Numenius

Numenius, a Platonist philosopher of the mid 2^nd century CE, had considerable impact on later Platonism, most notably on Plotinus (3^rd c.) and Porphyry (3^rd-4^th c). His work, surviving only in fragments, is important both historically and philosophically. Its historical significance lies mainly in that it shows how much of Plotinus’ philosophy, especially Plotinus’ metaphysics, was inspired by earlier Platonists such as Numenius, who was one of the authors read in Plotinus’ seminar (Porphyry, Life of Plotinus 14.12). Plotinus’ debt to Numenius’ philosophy was much debated already by Platonists of Plotinus’ generation (ibid. 18.2–3, 17.1–23). This discussion shows that Plotinus was not considered in his own time to have initiated a new and distinct movement in Platonism—what we today call Neoplatonism. He was rather seen as simply continuing and developing the philosophy of previous Platonists, Numenius being prominent among them, just as they themselves had developed in similar fashion the work of their own Platonist predecessors. Numenius’ significance also lies in his impact on the thought of early Christian thinkers like Origen and Eusebius, who were captured by Numenius’ references to Hebrews as an ancient source of true doctrines (see below Numenius’ Platonism) and saw in his doctrine of three gods a prefiguration of the Christian trinitarian doctrine.

Philosophically, Numenius’ work is important because he, like Eudorus and Moderatus (1^st c. CE), tried to construct a hierarchical system of intelligible principles (archai) of reality, but unlike them he held that intelligible principles are responsible only for the order of the world, wherein its goodness lies, while matter has an existence independent of these principles and accounts for disorder and badness. In this sense Numenius maintains a dualism in metaphysics that has affinities with that of Plutarch but also with that of the Chaldean Oracles. Numenius’ system of three principles of reality, similar to Plotinus’ hypostases of One, Intellect and Soul, was constructed on the basis of accounts of the intelligible world and its primacy, and of the soul as a spiritual substance essentially related to that world, in Plato. More specifically, it results from reflection on and interpretation of the Form of the Good in Republic VI, the demiurge and the world-soul of the Timaeus, and the One of the Parmenides. The hierarchical order of these principles of reality is determined by the degree of unity and simplicity of each; the highest principle is the simplest and most completely a unity. It is also absolutely good and transmits goodness.

The reconstruction of Numenius’ philosophy that follows below relies on direct quotations, all of which come from the Christian writer Eusebius of Caesarea (4th c.), and on testimonies, coming from a variety of ancient sources, such as Origen, Porphyry, Calcidius, Macrobius, Proclus. The collection of É. des Places used here, in the absence of a better one, fails to distinguish between fragments and testimonies, thus “fr.” in this collection and here stands for both fragments and testimonies. Boys-Stones 2018a includes in his collection of Middle Platonist texts all fragments and testimonies of Numenius with English translation. Reinhardt (2023) collects, translates and comments on the fragments of Numenius’ On the Dissension of the Academics from Plato (816–836), while Jourdan 2023, the first monograph on Numenius, offers a collection of the fragments and testimonies of Numenius’ work On the Good with French translation (467–493).

• 1. Life and Work
• 2. Numenius’ Platonism
• 3. Metaphysics
• 4. Psychology
• 5. Influence
• Bibliography
  • Primary Literature
  • Secondary Literature
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Life and Work

Very little is known about Numenius’ life. The existing evidence associates Numenius with two cities, Apamea in Syria and Rome. Plotinus’ student, Amelius, who was an enthusiastic admirer of Numenius (Porphyry, Life of Plotinus 3.44–5), calls him “Apamean” (ibid. 17.18) and himself moved from Rome to Apamea after Plotinus’ death (ibid. 2.32–33). John Lydus (6^th c. CE), however, refers to Numenius as “the Roman” (De mensibus ΙV.80, p. 132.11–12 Wünsch). The strong interest that both Amelius and Porphyry take in Numenius makes the evidence about Numenius in Porphyry’s Life of Plotinus quite significant, but the testimony of John Lydus may also hold some truth. One possible way of reconciling the two is that Numenius was born in Apamea but taught both there and later also in Rome (Dodds 1960, 6–7). Such a hypothesis may explain two facts, first, Numenius’ familiarity with different intellectual traditions, including oriental ones, and, second, the attraction that Rome exercised to Plotinus, who moved there from Alexandria in 246 and founded his own school. (Jourdan 2023, 17–8).

Several indications point to a date around the middle of the 2^nd century CE for Numenius’ philosophical activity. There is good evidence to suggest that Numenius antedates the Platonist Atticus, whose floruit is set around 176 (Eusebius, Chronicle, p. 207 Helm): Proclus in his 5^th-c. CE Commentary on the Timaeus outlines in chronological order the views of ancient Platonists on the relation of the demiurge (the creator god of the Timaeus myth) to the Forms, presenting first those of Numenius, then of Harpocration and Atticus, then of Plotinus, Amelius, Porphyry and Iamblichus (In Timaeum I.303.27–307.19). The chronological order is disturbed only by the place of Harpocration (a pupil of Atticus) in the list, but this is because the latter follows Numenius rather than Atticus in his interpretation of the way the demiurge relates to the Forms (Proclus, In Timaeum I.304.22–305.16; on this matter see below the sections on, Metaphysics, Influence). Furthermore, a number of indications suggest Atticus’ own dependence on Numenius. Atticus’ work targeting those who profess to teach Plato’s philosophy through the use of the writings of Aristotle (Atticus frs. 1–9 Des Places) may well be inspired from Numenius’ plea for a purification of Plato’s philosophy from alien elements, Aristotelian and Stoic included. Numenius argues for a similar purification in his work On the Dissension of the Academics from Plato (fr. 24–28 Des Places). The resemblance between the relevant works of Atticus and Numenius extends to details: the analogy of Plato’s philosophy with the body of Pentheus torn apart by the Bacchai, that is found in Atticus (fr. 1.19–23 Des Places) goes back to Numenius (fr. 24.71–73), and so does the comparison of the 3^rd c. BCE Academic skeptic Arcesilaus’ suspension of judgment (epochê) to the cuttle fish spreading ink (Numenius fr. 25.77–81; cf. Atticus fr. 7.78–81 Des Places). Atticus, however, presents Plato as the one who unified philosophy by putting together its dispersed parts, while Numenius implies that Plato combined parts which were belonging to the same body, i.e. Pythagorean philosophy. Besides, Numenius makes Arcesilaus resemble the cuttle fish, in order to highlight the latter’s skeptic suspension of judgment as an escaping device, while Atticus applies the same analogy to Aristotle whose philosophy he criticizes as obscure. Numenius’ dating in the middle 2^nd century is compatible with two further facts: the first surviving author who mentions Numenius is Clement of Alexandria (ca. 150–215) in his Stromata (I.22.150.4). Clement cites Numenius asking rhetorically what is Plato but an atticizing Moses, a citation that Eusebius takes up (Praep. Ev. XI.10.14, fr. 8; on this see below, Influence). The second fact that pertains to Numenius’ dating is that the latest author that Numenius mentions is Mnaseas (fr. 25.17), the “methodist” doctor of the 1^st c. CE. Numenius’ fragments and testimonies exhibit many resemblances with the Chaldean Oracles, a collection of verses composed at the time of Marcus Aurelius (161–180), but it is unclear who is dependent on whom here, or whether we have to do with parallel developments (on this see Jourdan 2023, 147–216).

We are fortunate to know the titles of some of Numenius’ treatises. One was On the Good, which comprised at least 6 books (Eusebius, Praep. Ev. XI.18.22). Apparently, this was one of Numenius’ most important works and judging from the existing excerpts, it must have been cast in dialogical form (see frs. 3, 4a Des Places; cf. Edwards 2010, 118–120, Jourdan 2023, 24–28). In it Numenius set out to outline his ontology and theology and, more specifically, to investigate the nature of the first principle, which is divine, the cause of everything, and also the source of goodness (hence the title On the Good). Numenius is clearly inspired by Plato’s accounts of the Form of the Good in Republic VI (508e-509b) and of the goodness of the demiurge in the Timaeus (29e-30b), yet, as explained below, he did not identify the demiurge with the Form of the Good; rather, the demiurge is distinct from and dependent on the Form of the Good. Also important must have been Numenius’ work On the Indestructibility of the Soul (Origen, Against Celsus V.57; fr. 29 Des Places), in at least two books. We know of only one certain testimony of this work, but it is probable that many of the testimonies of later Platonists regarding Numenius’ views on the soul reflect claims made in it (Dillon 1977, 364; see below, Psychology). Quite unclear, though, remains the content of Numenius’ treatise On Plato’s Secret Doctrines (Eusebius, Prep. Ev. XIII.4.4; fr. 23 Des Places). In the sole surviving fragment (fr. 23) Numenius discusses Plato’s use of the character Euthyphro in the Euthyphro as representative of Athenian popular religion. Dillon (1977, 364) has speculated with reason that in this work Numenius proposed allegorical interpretations of aspects of Platonic dialogues, while more recently Jourdan (2023, 21, 69–71) has claimed that Numenius proposed an allegorical interpretation of the main divine figures in Hesiod’s Theogony, which are presented in Cratylus (396a-d). This is possible since Numenius appears to have indulged in allegorical interpretation of the cultic practices of various nations, taking them to be philosophically significant (fr. 1a; see below, Numenius’ Platonism). But given Numenius’ attachment to Pythagoreanism (on which see below, Numenius’ Platonism) it may also be the case that in this work Numenius presented doctrines that Platonists traditionally associated with Plato, such as the immortality of the soul, as originally Pythagorean (see Dillon 1988, 121).

Numenius’ best attested work is his treatise On the Dissension of the Academics from Plato (frs. 24–28 Des Places, also in Reinhardt 2023). Eusebius in his Preparatio Evangelica (Preparation for the Gospel) has excerpted five long pieces from it (in book XIV). The reason why Eusebius quotes so extensively from this work of Numenius is in order to substantiate his claim, which permeates the entire Preparatio Evangelica, that ancient philosophers were in disagreement with each other. He takes that feature to indicate the inability of pagan philosophy to reach the truth (on Eusebius᾽ reading of Numenius see des Places 1975, Jourdan 2015). This is an originally skeptic argument, that is employed by Academic and Pyrrhonean skeptics alike, to the effect that dogmatic philosophy amounts to failure because of the disagreements occurring in it (Cicero, Academica II.115, Sextus Empiricus, Against the Mathematicians II.11). Eusebius has a special kind of disagreement in mind, namely that with Plato’s philosophy, which he considers to have come closer to the truth than any other pagan philosophy, that is, in his view, to Christian doctrine (Praep. Ev. XI.pref. 2–3, XI.8.1, XIII.4.3). Numenius’ testimony in this work fits well an argument like that of Eusebius. For Numenius criticizes in this work the departure of the skeptical Academics from what he considers to be Plato’s central doctrine, namely, the doctrine of first principles of reality that Numenius finds adumbrated in the 2^nd Letter attributed to Plato (fr. 24.51–6). For Numenius it is primarily the disagreement of the Academic skeptics with Plato’s allegedly dogmatic philosophy that marks a failure. The surviving fragments of this work indicate Numenius’ strong concern with the history of Platonism and are quite telling as to the tendencies of Platonism at this time. Presumably Numenius’ reaction against a skeptical interpretation of Plato were triggered by attempts chronologically close to him, such as those by Anonymous in Theaetetum (1^st c. CE?), Plutarch, and Favorinus (1^st-2^nd c. CE), to revive a form of academic skepticism (see Opsomer 1998), which Antiochus of Ascalon (1st c. BCE) had rejected as alien to Plato’s philosophy (see Karamanolis 2006, 44–59). Three other works of Numenius, namely Epops, On Numbers, On place (Origen, Against Celsus IV.51; fr. 1c), were consulted by Origen but are only titles to us (see Zambon 2002, 180–181 and Jourdan 2023, 21–23 for some speculation about their possible subject-matters).

2. Numenius’ Platonism

The remains of Numenius’ work leave no doubt that he relied primarily on texts of Plato in constructing his own system of principles. Ancient testimonies are, however, divided between those that classify him as a Platonist philosopher (Porphyry, Life of Plot. 14.12, Eusebius, Praep. Ev. XI.21.7) and those that consider him a Pythagorean (Origen, Against Celsus I.15, VI.51, V.38; frs. 1b–1c, 53, Porphyry, Ad Gaurum 34.20–35.2; fr. 36, Calcidius, In Timaeum 297.8 Waszink; fr. 52.2 Des Places). We should not see any contradiction or even tension in this double classification. Numenius is a Pythagorean Platonist like Moderatus half a century earlier or Eudorus around the turn of the millennium. That is, Numenius accepted both Pythagoras and Plato as the two authorities one should follow in philosophy, but he regarded Plato’s authority as subordinate to and dependent on that of Pythagoras, whom he considered to be the source of all true philosophy—including Plato’s own (see Frede 1987, 1047–1048, Mansfeld 1992, 298, Jourdan 2021a). For Numenius Pythagoras’ views, like those of Socrates, were originally passed on only orally (cf. fr. 24.57–60), while Plato instead wrote many philosophical works, in which he communicated the Pythagorean and Socratic doctrines. Interestingly, Numenius’ two authorities, Pythagoras and Plato, represent two different kinds of sources of philosophical tradition, an oral and a written one.

This view of Numenius is part of a more general view about the history of philosophy that we can reconstruct from his fragments. Numenius believes that the truths given to us by philosophy have a status like that claimed for the scriptures by revealed religions: they are the revelation of logos (reason) in which all nations have a share (frs. 1a, 1b) but which only certain inspired intellectuals could articulate properly and explain for the first time. Numenius appears to believe that the religious practices of the various nations are philosophically significant, because they contain some lore or “wisdom” that reflects philosophical truth, which means that religious practices can be recast in a philosophical account, in the same way that this was claimed for poetic episodes and myths (e.g. Homer’s cave of the Nymphs in the Odyssey recast later by Porphyry in his De antro Nympharum). We find a similar view first in Posidonius (1^st c. BCE) (in Seneca, Epist. 90.5–13, 20–25, 30–32; fr. 284 Edelstein-Kidd), in Plutarch (De Iside 369B, 355B-C), and then in several authors of the first two centuries CE. The Platonist Celsus, for instance, who must have been Numenius’ contemporary, wrote a work entitled True Account, in which he criticizes Christianity for deviating from the fundamental original wisdom that he takes to lie behind the religions of many nations (Origen, Against Celsus I.14, 16; see Frede 1994, 5193–5198). A similar view is maintained by Plutarch (fr. 157.16–25 Sandbach; cf. his On Isis and Osiris) but also, quite significantly, by the 1^st c. CE Stoic Cornutus in his Introduction to Greek Theology (see Boys-Stones 2001, 49–59, 105–114, Boys-Stones 2018c). It is apparently because Numenius took such a view of the religious practices of other nations that he was quite interested in the oriental traditions including the jewish one (see Jourdan 2021b). This view of Numenius suited well Christians like Eusebius, the source of Numenius’ quotations, who wanted to argue that the true doctrines of Plato derive from other intellectual traditions, transmitted by sages such as Pythagoras and Moses (see Michalewski 2021, 131).

Numenius maintains that in the Greek tradition the revelation coming from reason was first grasped and articulated in properly philosophical terms by Pythagoras, the source of true philosophy; it then found its way into the philosophy of Plato. Numenius argues that Plato appropriated Pythagoras’ doctrine and outlined it in his own work (fr. 24.56–62). He suggests that Plato accessed Pythagorean philosophy directly, presumably through his own acquaintance with Pythagoreans, but also, and this is quite remarkable, indirectly through Socrates, who, according to Numenius, was also philosophically a Pythagorean and was communicating to his pupils Pythagorean doctrines (fr. 24.51–59), most especially the doctrine of the three gods (see below, Metaphysics), which is allegedly outlined in the pseudo-Platonic 2^nd Letter (312e). Numenius appears to suggest that Plato alone among his contemporaries was in a position to recognize Socrates’ Pythagoreanism because, before meeting him, Plato had already familiarized himself with Pythagorean philosophy (fr. 24.57–59; see Michalewski 2021, 133–136). This is strikingly different from Antiochus’ perception of Socrates as a source of scepticism which Plato abandoned in his mature works (Cicero, Acad. Pr. 15–18, Karamanolis 2006, 50–54). On Numenius’ view Plato speaks with authority in his many and extensive published works precisely because he communicates Pythagorean doctrines which he had drawn from Pythagoras and Socrates, but to the extent that Plato’s philosophy is derivative from the Pythagorean one, the authority of Plato’s written work is inferior to that of Pythagoras (frs. 7.5–7, 26.12–22; see further Boys-Stones 2018b, 198–199). This is why Numenius recommends a move away from Plato towards the discourses of Pythagoras (fr. 1a). We have, then, to do with a descending order of authority, that of ancient wise men including Pythagoras, then Socrates, then Plato, after whom a clear decline starts with Plato’s successors in the Academy (cf. frs. 23, 24 Des Places). Numenius appears to claim even that Plato was not completely faultless for the decline of Pythagorean philosophy that happened with the Academics. Plato, Numenius suggests, did not present his doctrines sufficiently clearly (fr. 24.60–66). This is why Numenius holds Plato partly responsible for the departure of later Platonists (i.e. the Academic skeptics) from Plato’s actual Pythagorean philosophy (fr. 24.60–66; Karamanolis 2006, 130–131). Plato’s obscurity is pointed out by several other Platonists in late antiquity, such as Plutarch (On Isis and Osiris 370E-F, On the Obsolescence of the oracles 421F) and Plotinus (Ennead IV.4.22.6–12), but none of them means this to be a criticism of Plato, as is apparently the case with Numenius, whose point is not that Plato did not make his views clear but rather that he did not make sufficiently clear his intellectual debt to Pythagoreanism and that this may have played a role in the dissension of his followers in the Academy (see further Jourdan 2021a). Eusebius highlights this view of Numenius in order to support his own apologetic argument that paganism is marked by dissent, which in the case of Plato, is of a particular kind, namely that Plato depended on higher authorities such as Pythagoras, while Platonists starting with Aristotle started betraying Plato, and in such a way, in Numenius’ view, they departed from Pythagoreanism.

Numenius continues the line of Eudorus and especially Moderatus of Gadeira (1^st c. CE), who also considered Plato to be a Pythagorean in his philosophical commitments. But unlike Moderatus (Porphyry, Life of Pythagoras 53) and other Pythagoreans (see e.g., Photius, Bibliotheca cod. 249, 438b14–19) who considered also later philosophers, such as Aristotle, as Pythagoreans (for instance Ps. Archytas, the author of a commentary on Aristotle’s Categories), Numenius apparently maintains that nobody after Plato had access to the Pythagorean wisdom. This is why he sets out to separate (chôrizein, fr. 24.68 Des Places) Plato the Pythagorean from all later Platonists, who betrayed the Pythagorean philosophy, which in Numenius’ view is the essence of Plato. Numenius appears then to be a more rigorous Pythagorean than his predecessors, Eudorus and Moderatus, let alone other contemporary Pythagoreans. He sets out to defend the authentic Pythagoreanism as is recast in Plato alone. This tension among Pythagoreans is indicative of a vivid debate they were having about the sources on which one can rely for the reconstruction of Pythagorean philosophy. This debate in turn is characteristic of a strong revival of the Pythagorean philosophy in the first two centuries CE. This revival becomes manifest in a series of Pythagorean pseudepigrapha of the same age. These are treatises which pass themselves off as written in ancient times and as communicating Pythagorean lore (see Centrone 1990, Ulacco 2017). It can also be seen in the attempt of Moderatus to present Pythagorean doctrines systematically in his Pythagorean teachings (Pythagorikai scholai; Stephanus of Byzantius s.v. Gadeira, and Porphyry, Life of Pythagoras 48; Karamanolis 2006, 132–134).

The stress on Plato’s Pythagoreanism on the part of Pythagoreans revives and extends connections between Plato’s metaphysics and Pythagorean ideas, noted already by Plato’s younger associates. Already Aristotle spotted these connections (e.g. Metaphysics A.6, M.3, N.3). That early Academics like Xenocrates showed strong interest in Pythagoras’ doctrines is presumably because they took them to be present in, or close to, those of Plato. They even wrote treatises on them (e.g. Diogenes Laertius IV.13). We also hear that Plato was accused of having copied the Timaeus from Philolaus’ book (Diogenes Laertius VIII.85) and in the 3^rd c. BCE Timon of Phlius parodied Plato for this (Aulus Gellius, Noctes Atticae III.17.4). The renewed emphasis on the Timaeus in the work of Platonists of the first centuries CE, such as Plutarch, which we can attribute already to Eudorus (see Dillon 1977, 117–121), is closely associated with the revival of Pythagorean Platonism. Platonists considered the Timaeus to communicate Pythagorean doctrine and even argued that it was inspired by the work of “Timaeus Locrus”, a late forgery in pseudo-Doric dialect (cf. Proclus, In Timaeum I.7.17–8.29). Numenius is following ample precedent in assigning a central role to the Timaeus for deriving a system of first principles on the basis of Plato’s metaphysics (Baltes 1975, 241–242). His interest in numbers (he wrote a work on numbers), to which he assigns an ontological role (fr. 2.20–24) may well be for him another doctrine that Plato had taken over from Pythagorean philosophy (see Staab 2002, 99–100).

3. Metaphysics

The existing evidence about Numenius suggests that he was strongly concerned with what we nowadays call metaphysics, that is, with the structure of reality, which, as with Plato and Aristotle, also with Numenius, includes ontology and theology. But as the remains of his treatise On the Good show, we do not deal with two sets of views here. Numenius defines the subject matter of this treatise as an investigation of the question what is being (fr. 3.1, fr. 5.5, fr. 7.12–13), which is reminiscent of Aristotle’s definition of first philosophy, or metaphysics, in Metaphysics Gamma (1003a20–32). Quite notably, however, Numenius declares that he will be guided in his investigation by the Timaeus (referring to Timaeus 27d-28a; fr. 7.8–12 Des Places). In line with the Timaeus, Numenius treats the Good as the highest principle of everything there is, while he introduces also lower and intermediate principles of reality that he considers divine.

As a true Platonist, Numenius maintains a sharp distinction between the sensible and the intelligible world—the realms of becoming and (true or pure) being respectively (fr. 16.8–10). In his On the Good he proceeds in an ontologically ascending order, starting with sensible (physical) entities, moving to the intelligible ones (including Platonic Forms), and finally to the first principle, the Good, that is the Platonic Form of the Good in the Republic (508e) that he identifies with God (that is, the first and highest god). Arriving at this description of the first principle is the final aim of the treatise. This is understandable since according to Numenius everything that exists in the world as it is, depends on the Good, the God, which is the cause of everything’s goodness in the world (fr. 19.5–7 Des Places). Beginning his investigation from natural elements (stoicheia), namely earth, fire, water, and air (cf. Timaeus 31b-c), Numenius argues that no such element can possibly qualify as a being (as having being), first because elements, like syllables, cannot exist by themselves but only in combination, and secondly because no bodily entity whatever can qualify as a being (as having being), because bodies are subject to change (fr. 3.1–8 Des Places). This means that all bodies have, at best, being-and-not-being (cf. Republic 479c). What is more, Numenius suggests that for a body to exist, there must be something to keep it together and account for its unity (fr. 4b.11–19 Des Places), and this cannot be a further body but rather must be a power (dynamis; fr. 4b18), that is an intelligible entity, for instance a soul, which is necessary to account for the unity of bodies, as we see that it does for living things (fr. 4b). In the Timaeus (33b), for instance, it is made clear that it is the world-soul that keeps the body of the world together.

Such an argument shows that Numenius has strong views about the ontological status of matter, the basis, he supposes, of all bodies (fr. 4b.25 Des Places). In his 4^th c. CE Latin commentary on the Timaeus Calcidius presents a long discussion about the status of matter (In Timaeum p. 297.7–301.20 Waszink; see further Reydams-Schils 2020, 118-138), claiming that this is based on Numenius (fr. 52.2). If Numenius did elaborate on the status of matter along the lines suggested in Calcidius, that must be because it was crucial to do so for his argument about what qualifies as being and also how the world has come into existence. Interpreting the Timaeus literally, Numenius maintains that matter has never come into existence, is uncreated and co-eternal with, and yet distinct from, god (fr. 52.7–14; cf. Alcinous, Didascalicus ch. 12, 166.15–30 Hermann), associated with necessity (fr. 52.120–129), unlimited (apeiros), indefinite (aoristos), fluid, without form and quality (fr. 3, fr. 52.6–14, 44–45; cf. Antiochus in Cicero, Lucullus 27, Alcinous, Didascalicus 163.6 Hermann; see Jourdan 2014, O’Brien 2015, 158–160). This does not mean, however, that matter does not have a nature or substance of its own (fr. 52.92). Clearly, Numenius like other Platonists of his age follows Aristotle in identifying Plato’s receptacle in the Timaeus with matter, which Aristotle characterizes as non being (Physics 192a3–14), formless and qualityless (De caelo 306b17–19; cf. Timaeus 50d7). This lack of form of matter amounts to lack of reason for Numenius (alogos; fr. 4a.1–4; see Jourdan 2014, 142–144). In the same vein already Plutarch (De Iside 374C f.) identified matter with Poverty (penia that is informed by Abundance (poros), giving a cosmological twist to Plato’s myth in the Symposium (203bf.). Since matter is lacking reason, Numenius considers it in itself disordered (ataktos) and unknowable (fr. 4.4–5). Because disorder and division were taken to be essential characteristics of matter in the earlier Platonist tradition, matter had been identified with the indefinite “dyad” (fr. 52.1–14) that is referred to in Aristotle’s account of Plato’s metaphysics (Met. A6, 988a9–15; cf. Plato, Parmenides 149d2; see Baltes 1975, 255–6). This was widely maintained among the Pythagorean Platonists (Sextus Empiricus, Against the Mathematicians 10.261), including Eudorus (Simplicius, In Physica 181.7–30, 281.5) and Moderatus (ibid. 231.8–9; see Frede 1987, 1052). Numenius follows precisely this line of thought (frs. 11.15, 52.6). And since for Numenius disorder amounts to badness, he considers matter to be bad, and indeed the source and cause of all instances of badness and disorder in the world (fr. 52.37–9, 63–64).

Numenius might appear to maintain that disordered matter (cf. Timaeus 30a) is animated by an evil world soul (fr. 52.64–5 Des Places), as might be suggested in Laws 10 (896e) (cf. Plutarch, De animae procreatione in Timaeo 1014D). However, Calcidius’ text, which preserves this view of Numenius, suggests instead that matter is not animated by, but somehow simply is the evil world soul, that is, matter has life of its own (fr. 52.44–47, 66–67; see Baltes 1975, 247–248 but also Deuse, 1983, 68–73, Phillips 2002, 237, Jourdan 2014, 145, O’Brien 2015, 162–165). This has been variously interpreted. Presumably this is is not an evil soul of itself, but rather the soul of matter (silvae anima; fr. 52.92; see Jourdan 2014, 145–148). For a soul, if it animates anything, cannot be really evil in doing so, as it is the principle of life, and life is one kind of order and thus good (see Waszink 1966, 68–9, Baltes 1975, 250–251, Frede 1987, 1053). Presumably matter is the cause of an evil world soul which accounts for disorderly movement, that is the place where this kind of soul manifests itself, in the same sense that the human soul that is originally rational, an intellect (see the section on Psychology below) becomes non-rational when it enters the body (Jourdan 2014, 148–151). Perhaps then we deal with one soul which turns from disorderly/bad, when in matter, to orderly/good, when matter is ordered (see Boys-Stones 2018a, 224–225). The fact that for Numenius matter (that is, disorderly matter) is bad, however, does not necessarily entail that the material world is also bad, as Dillon (1977, 369) suggests, associating Numenius with the Gnostic idea of an evil world. It actually seems that quite the opposite is the case: for Numenius the world is good because it is ordered due to the dominance of the highest principle/god, the Good, and it makes a strong opposition to disorderly matter, which qualifies as evil, an idea we find also in the roughly contemporary with Numenius Chaldean oracles (88, 88, 128, 134, see Jourdan 2023, 193). Besides, as Jourdan (2014, 143–144) has pointed out, matter is not placed at the level of the highest god but rather at the level of the second one, the demiurge, the source of providence in the world (fr. 52.94–100).

Now, for Platonists only intelligible entities can account for order which amounts to goodness and only they can qualify as beings, neither matter nor bodies. A Platonic Form, for instance, is responsible for the ordered existence of the physical things it is the Form of. A soul too accounts for the existence of living things, such as animals. Since the world has an order of its own as a single well-ordered whole, there must be such an intelligible entity that accounts for the world’s order, wherein its goodness or orderliness lies (kosmos). Being the source of this comprehensive goodness, this must itself be surpassingly good (frs. 16.14–15, 19, 20). Platonists tended to identify this principle with the Form of the Good in the Republic (508e), which is the source of all being. It was also traditional among them to think of this principle as a divine one, a God.

Numenius, then, distinguishes two sources of reality, or two ontological principles, god-the Good and matter (inspired by Timaeus 47e-48a and Aristotle’s report about Plato’s principles in Metaphysics 988a7–15) but, as pointed out above, matter is not considered as a principle opposite to the highest god-the Good but rather to the demiurge, the second God. The Good stays rather above matter, which is why order prevails in the world. Yet the crucial question for Numenius was how one should think about this divine principle, the Good, what kind of god this is, given that this is the source of everything there is. Numenius’ position on this has much to do with his view on matter. Numenius advocates a strong dualistic position. In this he is like Plutarch and later Atticus follows them. Numenius’ dualism is different from that of most contemporary Pythagoreans we know of, like those referred to by Alexander Polyhistor (in Diogenes Laertius VIII.25), by Sextus Empiricus (Against the Mathematicians X.261–2), by Nicomachus of Gerasa (Theologia Arithmêtikê in Photius, Bibliotheca cod. 187, 143a24), by Eudorus (Simplicius, In Phys. 181.10–30) and by Moderatus (Porphyry, On Matter in Simplicius, In Phys. 231.6–24). Those Pythagoreans postulated god or One, on the one hand, and matter or the indefinite dyad, on the other, but they maintained that god or One is the ultimate principle of everything (Simplicius, In Phys. 7.1–30); from it matter came into existence through the total privation of form (ibid. 231.7–9). Numenius appears to be reacting against this view, which is associated specifically with Moderatus (fr. 52.15–23; see Kahn 2001, 133).

Numenius rejects Moderatus’ view in favor of his own dualistic position, presumably because he wants to avoid the implication of the monistic position that god is the source of what is bad. This concern seems also to motivate Numenius to distance god from matter as much as possible. He thus distinguishes the divine demiurge, who creates the physical world by imposing order on matter, from the highest god. In Numenius’ view this highest god is metaphysically above the demiurge (frs. 16, 17, 19–21); the highest god, which Numenius also calls the first intellect (fr. 20.12), is inert or inactive (fr. 12.13, 15.2) and utterly simple (fr. 11.11–14), qualifies as being itself (auto on; fr. 17.4) and as the source of being (fr. 16.4–5, 9), while the demiurge is the source of generation (fr. 16.5). Quite importantly, the highest god is absolute goodness (frs. 16.4, 9–10, 20.12), identical with the Form of the Good (fr. 20.5, 11). Unlike the Form of the Good in Republic VI, however, that is beyond being, Numenius’ first god is being, and indeed the source of it (fr. 2.14, fr. 16.10 symphyton têi ousiai; see Jourdan 2023, 52–53). This is not at odds with the Republic, since several passages in it describe the Good as being (518c9, 526e3–4, 532c5–6; see Burnyeat 2005, 154–155). Numenius apparently takes stance in a debate among Platonists as to whether the first principle is being or beyond being (Origen, Against Celsus IV.64.14–28). Numenius actually describes the first god as being (ho ôn), a phrase that alludes to Exodus 3.14 (fr. 13.4). This Biblical reference has been much debated and a number of alterations of the text have been proposed (see Dodds 1960, 15–16, Baltes 1975, 262, Dillon 1977, 368, Tarrant 1979, Edwards 1989). None of these proposals is, however, convincing, since Numenius frequently designates the first god as being in his work (frs. 5.5–14, 6.7–8, 8.2; see Whittaker 1978, Edwards 1990b, 21–22, Burnyeat 2005, 149–162). Yet this first god that is identified with being and absolute goodness, remains “alone, isolated, abandoned” (fr. 2.9), which suggests that this god, like Plotinus’ One, is unknown and perhaps even unknowable (cf. Plotinus, Enneads V.3.14, VI.9.3; see further Whittaker, 1993). Numenius thus sets himself apart from those Platonists who identified the divine demiurge of the Timaeus with the Form of the Good of Republic VI (508e), but his view is adopted by Alcinous (Didascalicus ch. 10, 164.27–165.16 Hermann), who must be writing some decades later than Numenius, which means, given the nature of Alcinous’ work, that this view became widespread among Platonists. We also find a similar description of the highest god in the Chaldean Oracles (Chaldean Oracles 11; see Jourdan 2023, 151).

Numenius faces two challenges. First, how can the first god be the ultimate cause of everything, as it appears that it ought to be (fr. 16.1–2, 9), if it is inert? Second, how can this god be simple, as Numenius has claimed, if it is, as he has also claimed, an intellect that thinks? Numenius addresses these challenges maintaining that the first or highest god, or first intellect, brings about a second one (frs. 13, 21.7), in fact the divine demiurge, and uses this second intellect as an instrument of its thinking (fr. 22.1–2). It is not clear what this instrumental use (proschrêsis fr. 22.2) amounts to, but we find similar vocabulary in the Timaeus (28a7) for the use of the Forms by the demiurge. Plotinus also describes the Intellect as an instrument of the highest principle, the One (Enn. V.4.1). It is clearer, however, that the second intellect thinks of the Forms and creates by imposing them on matter (fr. 18.10). Numenius is inspired again by the Timaeus. On the basis of Timaeus 39e7–9 Numenius apparently believes that the demiurge encompasses all Forms in him. To the extent that all other Forms exist by participating in the Form of the Good (frs. 16.2–5, 46b–c), which is identical with the first intellect, this intellect accounts also for all the (other) Forms (Frede 1987, 1060–1063), while it is the second god who actually thinks of them (see Jourdan 2023, 217–236; for an overview of the debate see Boys-Stones 2018b, 156–157, 166–167). Apparently, the demiurgic intellect needs a prior cause that accounts for being, order, and goodness, while the highest God needs another intellect so that goodness and order can bring about something as the result of thinking (cf. O’Brien 2015, 152). Now, presumably the first intellect thinks only itself, like the Aristotelian god of Metaphysics Lambda, and in this sense its being and its object of thought are identical. If this is the case, then the first god can be said to remain absolutely simple, pure goodness, at rest and inert, being itself, while the second god is in motion (fr. 15.3–4), is not simple, because it contains the Forms of all entities, and is good only because of its relation to the first god, the Form of the Good, a relation which Numenius describes as “imitation” (fr. 16.15), or as “participation” (frs. 19.9–11, 20.7–10). This nonetheless does not mean that Numenius considers the demiurge to be ignorant and a less than good creator and in this sense like the demiurge of the Gnostics, as Dillon (1977, 369) has argued (cf. O’Brien 2015, 140). Although clearly the demiurge is not as good as the first god, however, for Numenius the demiurge is a recipient of the goodness of the highest god, the Good, which and in turn transmits this goodness to the world which it brings into existence (frs. 14,16, 19), which means that he is not only aware of the highest God but also collaborates with him (O’Brien 2015, 156). In this respect Numenius’ demiurge is clearly different from the malevolent creator god of the Gnostics.

Yet creation is a process which, according to the Timaeus (if it is taken literally), can be divided into two stages, the demiurgic intellect’s thinking of the Forms of all entities and its imposing them on matter. Numenius maintains that the demiurgic intellect, the second god in his hierarchy, splits into two when actually engaged in the creation in the world, that is, when he comes in contact with matter, which is required for and involved in creation (fr. 11). This is not easy to understand. We have evidence to suggest that the demiurgic intellect engages in creation through a third god, that is, a third intellect (frs. 21.3–5, 22.4), which is thinking in a discursive way (dianooumenon; fr. 22.4), not in the purely contemplative way in which the demiurgic intellect thinks. This may mean that the third god sets out to articulate the Forms present in the second god/intellect and apply them to matter (Boys-Stones 2018c, 191, O’Brien 2015, 156-157). And the split of the second god into two may have to do with the fact that matter divides because it inspires desire in the demiurge (fr. 11.13–16), presumably desire for imposing order and goodness. Matter calls for order, as it has none; it is rather ruled by a principle of disorderly movement, an evil world soul (fr. 52.65–70). When the demiurge rules over matter, he is then divided into one intellect which continues contemplating the Forms and another which imposes Forms on matter and thus orders matter (frs. 11.14–20, 16.10–12, 21.4–5). This third god is conceived along the lines of the world-soul of the Timaeus; it is perhaps fair to say that for Numenius the god that actually engages in creation, that is, the third god, is in effect the world-soul of Plato’s Timaeus (Baltes 1975, 267). And in this sense the third god is the principle of order in matter, which had been so far ruled over by a principle of disorder, the evil world soul. Numenius uses very metaphorical language, inspired by the myth of Plato’s Statesman, in order to present what the demiurge does and how it thinks in doing it. He argues that it is like a helmsman steering a ship using the Forms as instrument (fr. 18 with Statesman 272e; cf. Timaeus 39e). Despite the metaphorical language that leaves much uncertain, two things become reasonably clear. First, this intellect, the third god which is identical with the (good) world-soul, is also active in preserving order and maintaining the world in existence (frs. 12.14–19, 18, 52.91–8). Secondly, the third god desires to create (fr. 11.16–20, 18.7–13), which amounts to saying that god, in the person of this third intellect, wants to impose order in the world because order is good (see Deuse 1983, 65–67). Since this third intellect/god is directly responsible for the existence of the world, it is ultimately not distinguishable from the world itself (fr. 21.3), which according to Timaeus 34b1 is god, because it is this which keeps the world together (see also Tarrant 1979).

There is a question of how to understand Numenius’ hierarchy of three gods. Should we take seriously Proclus’ testimonies that suggest there are in fact three (frs. 21–22), or the fragments of Numenius preserved by Eusebius which suggest that there are actually only two (frs. 15–16, 20)? This is a much debated issue in scholarship (see Boys-Stones 2018a, 156-157, O’Brien 2015, 157–158, and most recently Jourdan 2023, who argues in favor of the gods being two). The question becomes accentuated in view of Numenius’ statement that the second and third gods are one, using the verb “to be” in the singular (estin; fr. 11.14–15) in referring to them together. In a way only the first god is different in substance from the second and third, who make up a unity. But as Frede (1987, 1057–1059) has argued convincingly, the unity of the two gods does not mean their identity. The demiurge is split into two because of the effect of matter. The second god is divisible in the same way that some other intelligible entities, such as human and animal soul, are (fr. 41.6). Soul remains essentially the same in all animate beings and yet is divided, in the process of ensoulment of the things that it makes animate. This is probably the case with the demiurge as well; he is one operating in two distinct roles. That Numenius proposed a hierarchy of three distinct gods, rather than two (thus Holzhausen 1992, 253–254, Jourdan 2023), or three aspects of one god (Krämer 1964, 88), is strengthened by the fact that Christians like Origen and Eusebius, being Trinitarians, approve of his theology, although, as Jourdan rightly observes (2015), they use Numenius for their view on Father and Son.

Numenius’ three gods are the principles of being (first God) and generation (second and third god; fr. 16), and thus of everything that exists. And because the highest god is absolute goodness, the world of generation becomes good and beautiful (fr. 16.16–17). Numenius must be credited with the idea that goodness is transmitted from the highest god through the second, demiurgic intellect, through a third intellect, to the world, without god actually doing anything (fr. 14.6–14), an idea further developed later by Plotinus and can be found especially in his anti-Gnostic treatises, parts of the so-called Grossschrift (Enneads III.8, V.8, V.5, II.9; cf. also I.6).

4. Psychology

Like most contemporary Platonists, Numenius was much preoccupied with the status of soul and its relation to body. First, some fragments from Numenius’ treatise On the Good (frs. 2–4 Des Places) show clearly that the treatment of the soul was extensive in this work. Secondly, Numenius’ views on the soul are discussed by several later Platonists, including Porphyry, Iamblichus, Damascius, and Calcidius, while they can arguably be detected in Macrobius’ In Somnium Scipionis. The main reason for Numenius’ strong interest in the soul, especially the human soul, must have been one which can be detected also in Plotinus: the soul-body relation is paradigmatic for the relation between intelligible and sensible reality in general. The former is an instance of the latter, which means that we cannot grasp the one independently from the other. Indeed Numenius’ views on soul and its relation to body square well with his views on the relation between intelligible and sensible reality.

Porphyry reports that Numenius speaks of two souls, a rational and a non-rational one (Porphyry in Stobaeus I.350.25–351.1 Wachsmuth; fr. 44 Des Places), while Philoponus (In de anima 9.35–38; fr. 47) suggests that Numenius may have distinguished also a third kind of soul, namely a vegetative one (phytikon). To begin with Porphyry’s testimony, this is somewhat confusing because it does not make clear that Numenius distinguishes two kinds of soul and not two souls in a human being (as Merlan 1967, 103 claims), while it groups Numenius together with those Platonists who distinguish parts of the soul (reason, spirit, and appetite). This, however, is a different matter from that of distinguishing different kinds of soul for different kinds of living thing, although both distinctions can be held by a Platonist, and possibly also by Numenius. Further evidence, though, corroborates the conclusion that Numenius did distinguish at least two kinds of soul, a rational one for humans and gods, and a nonrational one for animals. The distinction of a third kind of soul for plants, though less well attested, is perfectly possible given the testimony of Timaeus 77b and given Numenius’ heavy reliance on the Timaeus. Porphyry himself states that according to Numenius the rational soul has an “assenting faculty” which motivates all actions (fr. 45 Des Places). This reference to assent suggests that Numenius operates with a notion of reason similar to that of the Stoics and that, like the Stoics, he considers souls of human adults to be nothing but reason. This view, though, does have Platonic credentials, arguably going back to Socrates as he appears in the Protagoras. This may explain why other Platonists contemporary with Numenius, such as Celsus (Origen, Against Celsus VIII.49), also endorse it. This picture is confirmed by Iamblichus’ testimony, which suggests that there is a fundamental opposition between Numenius’ two kinds of soul (On the Soul in Stobaeus I.374.21–375.18 Wachsmuth, fr. 43.4–5), namely the soul which is rational or intellectual and in its essence is that of gods (fr. 41.15–6; Kahn 2001, 130–1), and the soul that is essentially non rational, is not. For Numenius presumably humans have a rational soul, which is of the kind of the divine soul, an immortal intellect (fr. 31.25–6), and in this sense human souls have divine origin (fr. 52.73–5), but also a non-rational soul, which is connected to the body and is parallel to the maleficent world soul. This gets some confirmation from Iamblichus’ testimony (On the Soul in Stobaeus 374.21–375.1; fr. 43) according to which evil enters the soul through matter. The same view is reported anonymously by Proclus (On the Existence of Evils 40.5–18) and it is plausible that it should be attributed to Numenius (Abdavi Azar 2023).

Apparently Numenius sides with those (notably the Stoics) who believe that possessing reason makes a soul fundamentally different from souls devoid of reason, and that this is crucial both for the status of the soul as such as well as for its relation to the body and perhaps also for the related bodily functions. For Numenius functions of this kind, such as perception, memory, and desire, are not essential to the soul and are later additions to it (fr. 43.7–9), coming into existence with its embodiment. Numenius apparently held that the human soul is essentially an intellect that descended to human bodies through the planets (fr. 12.14–16). This is a view that also Celsus shared (Origen, Against Celsus VI.21; see Frede 1994, 5211), which we can find also in Hermetic treatises (Corpus Hermeticum. I.25; Dodds 1960, 8). Origen also adopts the view that the human soul is essentially an intellect that falls in bodies and then becomes a soul with the necessary faculties to operate within a human body, while retaining the ability to ascend and become an intellect again (On Principles I.4.1, I.8.1, II.6.4, II.9.7). Numenius must have made a similar distinction between the human soul strictly speaking, the intellectual one, and the aspects of it that come about because of the soul’s embodiment, the non-rational one (see Waszink 1966, 74, Deuse 1983, 76, Jourdan 2014, 157–161 esp. with regard to the relevant testimony of Calcidius). Most probably Numenius arrived at this view being guided by the analogy of the Cave, the story of Er, in Republic VII and X respectively, that is, the soul being similar to the sea-god Glaucus in Republic X (611) whose first nature has been obscured by layers of attached materials, but also by the description of the creation of the soul in the Timaeus (41e), according to which the demiurge mounts the souls on vehicles (ochêmata). Porphyry in his work The Cave of Nymphs makes clear that he relies on Numenius’ exegesis of the soul’s descent to bodies through the planets (frs. 30–33) and speaks of the honey offered by the astrologists in anticipation of the future pleasures of the souls in earth (fr. 32). Apparently, pleasures draw the soul towards the earth and also keep it attached to it, and it would be reasonable to think that, as in Plotinus and Porphyry, the soul according to Numenius must be liberated from them and turn towards its intellectual self, the intellectual soul.

Further light is shed in Macrobius’ long account about the descent of the soul from the sky to the earth (In Somnium Scipionis 1.12; test. 47 Leemans, omitted by Des Places), which at least to some extent must be drawn from Numenius (thus Dodds 1960, 8–10 against Beutler 1940, 676–677; the extent of Macrobius’ debt to Numenius is debated by Elferink 1968, Ley 1972, Baltes 1975, 252–3, Deuse 1983, 72–73). According to Macrobius’ story of the soul’s descent from heaven to earth, the soul acquires a number of capacities necessary for its functions in a body as it goes through the planets, such as the capacity of theoretical thinking (logistikon) in Saturn, that of practical thinking (praktikon) in Jupiter, the spirited aspect (thumos) in Mars, the perceptual capacity (aisthêtikon) and imagination (phantastikon) in the Sun, appetite (orektikon) in Venus, the linguistic capacity (hermeneutikon) in Mercury, and finally the vegetative functions (phutikon) in the Moon. As Frede (1987, 1072) has argued, the capacities acquired in the seven planetary spheres correspond to the seven parts of the soul according to the Stoics. It is crucial to stress that these acquired capacities neither are essential to soul nor do they change what the soul actually is, i.e. intellect (fr. 42). They rather are, as Iamblichus reports, causes of evil (On the Soul in Stobaeus I.374.21–375.18; fr. 43.7–9), as the soul loses its simplicity and purity. Yet the evil is not due (or not only due) to the capacities themselves, but rather to the accumulation of astral matter while the soul descends through the planets. This is confirmed by the testimony of Iamblichus according to which Numenius, Cronius,^[1] and Harpocration consider all embodiments to be invariably bad (fr. 48.10–14) and is compatible with Numenius’ view that matter is bad and the source of all that is bad (see above, Metaphysics; cf. Dillon 1977, 375–376, Zambon 2002, 213–221, Jourdan 2014, 145–161, 170–174). That is, through its descend to the body the soul’s contact with matter gives rise to a non-rational kind of soul, which remains distinct from the rational one, the intellect.

When the soul is released from the body at death, then it remains only what it is essentially, namely intellect (fr. 35.21–26). If this is so, then for Numenius only the intellect is immortal. This, however, conflicts with the report of Damascius (In Phaedonem I.177 Westerink; fr. 46a Des Places, wrongly attributed to Olympiodorus), according to which Numenius maintained that not only the essence of the soul, the intellect, is immortal, but also “the ensouled condition” survives death, that is, presumably the non-rational soul, the sum of all other psychic capacities connected to bodily functions, and also with the report of Philoponus (In de anima 3.35–38; fr. 47), according to which Numenius follows Plato’s Phaedrus (245c) in maintaining that “all soul is immortal” (Baltes 1975, 245–246, Deuse 1983, 77). The immortality of the entire soul, though, would be incompatible with the story of the soul’s descent, according to which the rest of the psychic capacities is acquired and not originally present in the soul. Yet Numenius possibly distinguished between the immortality of the intellect, and the immortality for the rest of the psychic capacities, the non-rational soul. The intellect is immortal in the sense that it always lives, while the non-rational part of the soul is immortal in that it survives death as its constituent capacities dissolve gradually into the spheres from which they were originated. This is also the view that Porphyry later takes (in Stobaeus 1.384.19–28, Porphyry fr. 453 Smith), who may well follow Numenius on this (see Smith 1974, 56–68, Karamanolis 2006, 292, and 2007). For Numenius the soul is immortal strictly speaking only in its essence, that is, as intellect, being free from body, even the astral body or matter accumulated during its descent. Numenius maintains that the human rational soul may continue to live in other bodies and these may also be bodies of animals if the soul becomes bad during its bodily life (fr. 49; cf. Alcinous, Didascalicus 178.26–179.39 Hermann). Presumably such a life, however, is a form of punishment.

5. Influence

Numenius had a powerful influence on contemporary and later philosophers, pagans and Christians alike. His impact was particularly pronounced on Plotinus and on many Platonists of Plotinus’ generation. It is possible that Numenius exercised some influence already on Ammonius Saccas, the teacher of Plotinus and the Christian Origen (see Nemesius, De natura hominis 69–72 Matthaei; fr. 4b Des Places), given that all of Ammonius’ students about whom we know anything show quite some respect for and knowledge of Numenius’ thought despite their disagreements on specific topics in Platonist philosophy. The main issue, however, which divides Ammonius and his followers from Numenius is the number of the intelligible principles. The pagan Origen, another student of Ammonius, is a rigorous monist, holding that the supreme god is also the creator of the universe (Porphyry, Life of Plotinus 3.32, Proclus, Platonic Theology II.4.9–22; see Saffrey-Westerink, Proclus Théologie Platonicienne vol. II, X-XX). Longinus, who studied both with Ammonius and the Christian Origen (Porphyry, Life of Plotinus 20.36–37), apparently also committed himself to this kind of metaphysical monism (Proclus, In Timaeum I.322.18–26; Longinus fr. 60 Männlein-Robert, 538–540), possibly in reaction to Numenius, whose work he reportedly knew well (Porphyry, Life of Plotinus 20.74–76). Also well acquainted with Numenius’ philosophy was Cronius, Numenius’ contemporary (frs. 46b 48), as well as Atticus (see above, Life and Work). Numenius’ work was particularly appreciated by the early Christians. The Christian Origen was reportedly a keen reader of the works of Numenius as he was of Plato and of Pythagoreans other than Numenius, like Moderatus and Nicomachus (Eusebius, Ecclesiastical History VI.19.8). Indeed, Origen has an impressive knowledge of Numenius’ work. This becomes evident in that he often refers to Numenius and reports on his work in his Against Celsus (I.15; fr. 1b, IV.51; fr. 1c, 10, V.57; fr. 29, V.38; fr. 53), which is remarkable given that Origen normally cites only from Scripture (see Kritikos, 2007, 406–7). Eusebius inherits precisely Origen’s appreciation of Numenius and he is the only ancient author who has preserved us quotations from Numenius (Jourdan 2015).

There are three reasons accounting for such a strong approval of Numenius by the early Christians. First, Numenius is rare among his contemporaries in showing respect for the Jewish tradition (frs. 1a-c, 8, 9); he is attested to speak of the religion of the Jews claiming that their God is incorporeal (Against Celsus I.15; fr. 1b), he is also reported as being a reader who practiced allegorical interpretation of the statements of Moses and the prophets of the Old Testament (ibid. IV.51; fr. 1c). Moreover, Numenius famously states that Plato is like Moses speaking Attic Greek (fr. 8.13; see Whittaker 1967, Edwards 1990a), he even alludes to Jesus and he also speaks of Moses and Egyptian sages (fr. 10a Des Places). Such attention to the Jewish tradition is important for the early Christian theologians and apologists who want to establish the superiority of the Jewish-Christian tradition against that of the pagan culture. This attention, however, is not motivated by historical concerns on the part of Numenius but rather by philosophical ones. Numenius wanted to show that the Jewish nation must be counted among the ancient ones that have a share in logos and also that Moses had a conception of the first principle similar to that of Plato, since both identified god with being (see Burnyeat 2005, 155–156). Secondly, Numenius’ doctrine of three divine principles of reality can be read (and apparently was read) as analogous to the Christian doctrine of the Trinity. To the extent that Numenius is an exegete of Plato, Christians feel entitled to claim that Plato in the 2^nd Letter foreshadows the doctrine of the Trinity, and use this argument to try to convince the pagans that Christianity is not something new but was anticipated in the best parts of the pagan philosophical tradition, namely in Plato, according to Numenius (Eusebius, Prep. Ev. XI.praef. 3, XI.20.1–3; see Kritikos 2007, 407–9). Origen in particular was inspired by Numenius’ distinction between the first god and the immediate agent of creation, a second, creator god, a distinction which is meant to preserve the immutability of the highest god (Origen, Against Celsus VII.42–44, Commentary on John I.6.35; Kritikos 2007, 409–416). Finally, Numenius is valuable for the argument which Eusebius makes in his Praeparatio Evangelica that the pagan philosophers disagree with each other and do not stick to what Eusebius considers the best part of Greek philosophy, which is Plato’s philosophy (see above, Numenius’ Platonism).

The extent of Numenius’ influence on Plotinus was debated in antiquity. Plotinus’ students, Amelius and Porphyry, were concerned to discredit the widespread charge of Plotinus’ plagiarism of Numenius (Life of Plotinus 18.1–8, 21.1–9). Amelius, who is attested to have known Numenius’ work by heart (ibid. 3.44–5), devoted a special work on this topic, On the Difference Between the Doctrines of Plotinus and Those of Numenius (ibid. 17.1–6). Porphyry discusses the matter extensively in his biography of Plotinus (ibid. 17–18, 21.1–9), making reference to Amelius’ work mentioned above as well as to Longinus’ claim that Plotinus’ works were far superior in terms of precision to Numenius’, Cronius’, Moderatus’, and Thrasyllus’ (ibid. 20.71–76, 21.5–9). Clearly, however, several of Plotinus’ views resemble those of Numenius: both distinguish three intelligible principles, both consider matter to be evil, although Plotinus does not raise it into a principle (see Ennead I.8), as Numenius does, both maintain that the goodness of the highest principle reaches down to the sensible world, and both consider the human soul to be essentially an intellect (see further O’Meara 1976, Dillon 2007, Michalewski 2012).

Amelius and Porphyry themselves are also much influenced by Numenius’ philosophy, as later Platonists point out. Amelius follows Numenius in maintaining that not only sensible entities but also intelligible ones participate in intelligibles (Syrianus, In Met. 109.12–14; fr. 46b). Porphyry also relies much on Numenius especially in his doctrine of the soul (e.g. Ad Gaurum 34.20–35; fr. 36, On the faculties of the soul in Stobaeus Anthol. I.49.25a; frs. 44, 45), to the extent that he is explicitly accused by Proclus of taking over Numenius’ views (on demons, In Timaeum I.76.30–77.23; fr. 37; see Waszink 1966, Zambon 2002, 171–250).

Numenius’ influence goes beyond the contemporaries of Plotinus. Iamblichus, Proclus, Syrianus, Philoponus and Damascius also draw on his work, although not always with approval (see frs. 46a-51). Proclus is particularly critical of Numenius. His criticism of Numenius has to do with the way in which the latter distinguishes between first and second god, the demiurge. Proclus accuses Numenius of counting the first god together with the second, failing to acknowledge that the first god is completely distinct from all other causes (Proclus In Tim. I.303.27–304.22). Proclus argues that it is not right to call the first god “Father” because the principle of Father is posterior to the highest principle and because when Plato speaks of “Father and Maker” (Tim. 28c3–5), he is not referring to two distinct realities but rather to two names pertaining to the demiurge, the second god or principle (In Tim. I.30414–22). According to Proclus, then, Numenius, despite his distinction of a principle higher than the demiurge, makes the same mistake that Atticus and other Platonists of this generation make, which is to attribute to the highest god functions of the demiurge (see Michalewski 2021, 138–148; cf. Ferrari 2014). This is why Proclus examines jointly Numenius, Harpocration, and Atticus while speaking of the demiurge (In Tim. I.303.25–305.16; see further Tarrant 2004).

Numenius was also used extensively by Calcidius in his commentary on the Timaeus (297.7–301.20 Waszink; fr. 52; see Phillips 2003, Reydams-Schils 2020, 163-171). Calcidius reports on Numenius in the section of his commentary on matter (295–299), and more specifically, in the part in which he presents the Pythagorean doctrine of matter (In Tim. 295). Besides that, recent research has established intriguing parallels between Numenius’ hierarchy of three gods and Calcidius theology (see Reydams-Schils 2007). Numenius is mentioned also by Macrobius in his In Somnium Scipionis (frs. 54–55), a work that exerted considerable influence in the Middle Ages, yet it is open to discussion to what extent Macrobius knows and makes use of Numenius (see above, section on Psychology, and Elferink 1968, Ley 1972).

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metaphysics | Origen | Plato | Plato: Timaeus | Platonism: in metaphysics | Plotinus | Porphyry | Pythagoras | Pythagoreanism

Acknowledgments

The author is grateful to Fabienne Jourdan and John Dillon for comments and suggestions, which have helped me in the revision of the entry. Needless to say, they do not agree with all of my views.