1. For an account of Ockham’s life, including a discussion of how these dates are calculated in Ockham’s case, see Wood 1997, Chap. 1. For further details of Ockham’s life, see Courtenay 1999.

2. By this time Latin was virtually no one’s native language. Ockham’s first language was probably Middle English. Latin was exclusively a second language that lived primarily in very specialized contexts: academic, ecclesiastical, legal, diplomatic. This fact suggests that it is probably wrong to look for “ordinary language” considerations in the Latin philosophical writings of this period, whether by Ockham or anyone else.

3. The technical term is ‘oblatus’ (“offered”); Ockham was an “oblate”. This practice was quite common and amounted to sending one’s child to boarding school. Various religious schools would often take in children from the surrounding area, educate them, feed and house them. The children were not necessarily expected to pursue a religious vocation later in life, although many of them did.

4. Ockham’s accuser may have been John Lutterell, who had been Chancellor at the University of Oxford for a while. The papacy at this time, together with all the offices and bureaucracy that went with it, was not located in Rome, but at Avignon. It was there between 1309 and 1377.

5. With the possible exception of two short works on logic—Lesser Treatise on Logic (Tractatus minor logicae) and Primer of Logic (Elementarium logicae)—but the authenticity of these has been questioned.

6. A list of Ockham’s works, with information on modern editions and English translations, can be found in Spade 1999b: 4–11. References below to the works will be made using the titles, abbreviations, internal divisions and other conventions specified in Spade 1999a: xv–xvii.

7. Ockham’s treatment of insolubilia (paradoxes like the Liar Paradox), for instance, appears to be greatly inspired by Walter Burley (Spade 1974), and his account of the semantics of relative pronouns as well as the machinery (although not the underlying semantics) of his theory of supposition are likewise derived from Burley (Brown 1972). Important details of his theory of truth conditions for tensed and modal propositions likewise already appear in Burley, although this may reflect more a “British”, as distinct from a “Continental”, way of formulating these conditions (Spade 1980: section III, pp. 13–22).

8. For example, his theory of topical “middles” and their role in his theory of consequence. See Normore 1999: 46.

9. Ockham’s treatment of modal syllogistic is fuller and more complete than any of his predecessors’, and is a significant achievement. See Normore 1999: 33.

10. This notion of signification is ultimately derived from Aristotle, On Interpretation 3, 16^b19–21, and especially from Augustine, De doctrina christiana, II, 1.1.

11. This way of putting the matter suggests that Ockham sees no difficulty with referring to presently non-existing objects by means of demonstratives. But the secondary literature is not agreed on this. See Normore 1975 and Karger 1976.

12. This ignores a prior division Ockham and others make, between “proper” and “improper” supposition. Improper supposition is in effect metaphorical or figurative reference. Medieval semantics did not have a good theory of metaphor, so that this part of supposition theory remained undeveloped by Ockham and others. Ockham’s three main kinds of supposition were not original, and were in fact fairly standard among medieval logicians, although his way of defining them reflects peculiarities of his own theory of signification and was used in connection with his metaphysical nominalism. The origins of supposition theory are not yet well understood, although the terminology of “personal” supposition suggests that it had something to do with theological considerations about “person” vs. “nature” in Trinitarian and Christological theory.

13. Note that the subject of “Every dog is a mammal” and of “Dog has three letters” is (apart from the quantifier in the former) exactly the same term. Medieval logic did not have quotation mark conventions, which were not regularly used until after the invention of printing, and the theory of material supposition provided a substitute for them. But material supposition had other uses that cannot be easily handled by quotation marks. For example, in “It is possible for him to run”, according to Ockham and many other medieval logicians, the expression ‘for him to run’ has material supposition not for itself but for the proposition “He runs” or “He is running”.

14. On the history of the idea of mental language from Plato to Ockham, see Panaccio 1999.

15. The respective role of causality and similarity with respect to natural signification in Ockham has been a controversial issue in secondary literature. See, e.g., Adams 1987: Chap. 4; Panaccio 2004: Chap. 7 and 2015.

16. This interpretation originates with Trentman (1970) and was further developed by Spade (1980) and others.

17. See Panaccio 1990 and 2004, Tweedale 1992, and Chalmers 1999. The former two argued for this interpretation largely on textual grounds, the latter on theoretical grounds.

18. For details of the following discussion, see Spade 1975, Panaccio 1990 and 2004: Chap. 4–6.

19. For example, proper names of individuals and the names of the Aristotelian categories. The reasons for these exceptions need not detain us here.

20. The phrase “endowed with” in the example must not be taken to refer to special things: it is what Ockham calls a ‘syncategorematic term’, the function of which is merely to connect in the right way the referring terms (or categorematic terms) with each other.

21. The case is made in detail in Panaccio 1990 and 2004: Chap. 4.

22. See on this Panaccio 2004: 86 and 2016.

23. Adapted with his terminology. For details, see Panaccio 2023, esp. Chap. 1.

24. For interesting discussions of the history of the razor in Ockham, see Brampton 1964, Maurer 1978 and 1984. For an assessment of the razor in connection with Walter Chatton, see Keele 2002 and Brower-Toland 2023a. For a consideration of the razor and religious authority, see Hagedorn 2022.

25. E.g., Treatise on the Body of Christ, Chapt. 29, OTh X, pp. 157–8; Sent. I, d. 30, q. 1; OTh IV, p. 290.

26. The story of this development is told in Boehner 1946. For a discussion of the reasons behind Ockham’s change of mind, see Panaccio 2004: 23–27.

27. For further discussion on the categories in metaphysics and logic, see Pelletier 2013: 128–142.

28. For a detailed discussion of Ockham’s procedure in a wide variety of cases, see Adams 1987, especially “Part One: Ontology” (1987: 3–313) and “Part Four: Natural Philosophy” (1987: 633–899).

29. See, e.g., Quodl., VI, q. 10, OTh IX, p. 623 for an argument against relational entities (doubleness, here) that relies on the impossibility of actual infinites. See, e.g., Quodl., IV, q. 23, OTh. IX, p. 407–8 for an argument against quantitative entities (continuous quantity or extension, here) that is a thought experiment involving God’s power and the nature of substances and their accidents.

30. The theory of connotation is coupled with the related theory of “exposition”. The latter is not fully developed in Ockham but became increasingly prominent in authors immediately after him. For more on the theory of exposition and its relation to connotation theory, see Spade 1990, Ashworth and Spade 1992.

31. This is more complicated. First, not all qualities are beings distinct from substances. Qualities of shape and figure, e.g., curvedness, straightness, are not. So, terms like ‘curved’ are connotative. Second, concrete qualitative terms, like ‘white’ and ‘hot’, are also connotative, but their abstract counterparts, ‘whiteness’ and ‘heat’, are absolute, since individual whitenesses and heats are qualities that do exist in Ockham’s ontology. See Adams 1987 for details.

32. Both discussions are more complicated, but this gives an indication of his view, see Summula philosophiae naturalis I, cc. 19–20, OPh VI, pp. 205–13. On the composition of material substances, see Cross 1999. For artifacts, see Pelletier 2022 and Majcherek 2022.

33. Translated in Boehner 1957 [1990: Chap. 1]. Ockham also treats this question in Sent. I, d. 2, q. 4, which is translated in Spade 1994: 114–48. There, he argues against Walter Burley, who explicitly held that one reason we need universals in our ontology is to make science in the Aristotelian sense possible.

34. With this section, and for further detail on Ockham’s physics, see Goddu 1984 and 1999.

35. ‘Species’ in this sense should not be confused with species as opposed to genus. In the present usage, ‘species’ means something like “appearance”.

36. This last step is the difficult one, the details of which medieval authors most disagree about. It goes without saying that many details of the epistemological story are omitted from this quick sketch.

37. E.g., Sent. II, q. 12–13, OTh V, p. 268–9. On Ockham’s rejection of the theory of species in intellectual cognition, see Panaccio 2004: 27–31.

38. On Ockham’s theory of intuitive and abstractive cognition, see Karger 1999, Panaccio 2004: Chap. 1, and Panaccio 2014. Much has been written, on the other hand, about Ockham’s distinctive thesis about the (supernatural) possibility of intuiting non-existing beings (in which case the relevant intuitive cognition would cause, he thinks, the true judgment that the intuited thing does not exist); see in particular Panaccio and Piché 2010.

39. See Adams 1986, Freppert 1988, Wood 1997, and King 1999.

40. This point is developed in McGrade 1999, in terms of what he calls “implicit divine command”.

41. The text is translated with an informative introduction and commentary in Wood 1997.

42. This remark needs to be carefully qualified, since Aquinas’s moral psychology is very subtle. But this is not the place to do it.

43. See, e.g., Maurer 1962: 285–86.

44. On Ockham’s “voluntarism”, see Normore 1998 and Schierbaum 2017, but almost all scholarship on Ockham’s ethics will touch on this point to one degree or another.

45. Duns Scotus allowed that we can choose not to act toward our ultimate good; but he did not think we can knowingly choose to act directly against it. For a discussion of Aquinas, Scotus, Ockham and others on these issues, see Adams 1999.

46. Hirvonen 2004 and Panaccio 2012 address the details of Ockham’s moral psychology as do the sources cited in note 39.

47. Shogimen (2007) has characterized Ockham’s political thought as “crisis management”, highlighting Ockham’s overall interest in delineating how and when political and ecclesiastical actors should respond to social, political, and religious unrest.

48. See McGrade 1974, Kilcullen 1999, Shogimen 2007, Robinson 2013 for various aspects of Ockham’s political thought.

49. See Robinson 2013 for detailed discussion of the Work of Ninety Days.

50. Opus nonaginta dierum, c. 65, OPol II, pp. 573–80. This chapter is translated by Kilcullen and included in Letter to the Friars Minor, pp. 48–59.