Notes to Structuralism in Physics

1. Einstein’s resolution of this conundrum is celebrated. He took the practical indistinguishability to betoken a deeper identity and, in his Principle of Equivalence, asserted that the two cases are the same. In effect acceleration produces a gravitational field. The theoretical underdetermination is eliminated by declaring that the inertial force \(-m\ba\) is really a gravitational force after all. The two \(T\)-theoretical terms are really just the same; and an inertial system with a homogeneous gravitational field just is the same thing as a uniformly accelerated system without a gravitational field.

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Heinz-Juergen Schmidt <hschmidt@physik.uni-osnabrueck.de>

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