Giovanni Pico della Mirandola

First published Tue Jun 3, 2008; substantive revision Wed Aug 21, 2024

A few paragraphs from a speech that Giovanni Pico (1463–1494) did not write about human dignity have drawn more comment than any other statement by a philosopher of his day. No philosophers of post-medieval, pre-Cartesian Europe are better known now than the prince and his contemporaries, Erasmus (b. 1466), Machiavelli (b. 1469) and Thomas More (b. 1478). Unlike them, he was fully committed to philosophia, as he understood it, and he was remarkably original—indeed, idiosyncratic. His persistently esoteric and aggressively recondite manner helps explain why the period identified with him—the Renaissance—has had so little attention in the canonical history of the discipline as presented today in Anglophonia, where aims, assumptions and attitudes of philosophers are so different.

1. Life

Pico was born on 24 February 1463, to a noble Italian family, the counts of Mirandola and Concordia near Modena in the Emilia-Romagna north of Tuscany. Around the age of 14 he enrolled at Bologna to study church law, but within two years he put his lawbooks away and moved to Ferrara, then shortly afterward to Padua, where he met and studied with Elia del Medigo, a Jew and an Averroist Aristotelian. By the time he left Padua in 1482, he had felt the contrary attraction of the Platonism that Marsilio Ficino was reviving in Florence. By 1484 he was writing letters to other Florentine luminaries, Angelo Poliziano and Lorenzo de’ Medici.

In 1485 the prince traveled to Paris, where aftershocks of conflict between nominalists and realists were still shaking this citadel of Aristotelian scholasticism. At the age of 22, before leaving Italy, he had already presented himself as a philosopher—by defending the technical terminology that since Petrarch’s time had incited philological critics to attack philosophical Latin as a barbaric breach of classical norms. Having refined his literary talent while adding new skills in philosophy, Pico issued this manifesto as a letter to Ermolao Barbaro, an eminent Venetian scholar. He used the occasion and the genre to show, like Plato in the Phaedrus, how rhetoric could arm philosophy against rhetorical assault.

After a short stay in Paris, Pico returned to Florence and then Arezzo, where he caused a ruckus by abducting a young woman already married to Giuliano Mariotto de’ Medici. Support came from Lorenzo, a more formidable Medici cousin, but the commotion and then a plague kept the young lord on the move. By this time, while writing a Commento in Italian on a friend’s love poem, he already had plans for a more ambitious project: to bind up philosophy’s sectarian wounds. He started with harmony (concordia) that he saw beneath the surface of conflict between Platonists and Aristotelians. His peacemaking soon became global, aiming for a single symphony of ideas that would harmonize all schools of thought, past and present.

To call attention to this hopeless enterprise, Pico decided to underwrite a magnificent conference in Rome early in 1487. In preparation he assembled 900 propositions from dozens of authorities—ancient and medieval, pagan and Christian, Muslim, and Jewish—and challenged all comers to debate them in public. He had these Conclusions printed in Rome at the end of 1486, and to introduce them he composed a speech that he never gave or had published. After he died in 1494, others mistakenly called this address an Oration on the Dignity of Man: Pico never gave it a title.

Intervention by the Holy See derailed Pico’s plans and blocked the conference. Innocent VIII indicted 13 of the 900 theses and appointed a commission that soon declared 6 of them suspect and condemned 7 others. The defendant’s hasty response was an Apology that provoked Innocent to denounce the whole collection of 900 propositions. The prince, dishonored and in danger, left Italy for France again, but authorities there detained him at the pope’s request and jailed him briefly. By the summer of 1488 he was back in Tuscany as Lorenzo’s guest, and in 1489 he dedicated his Heptaplus to his benefactor, describing it as a Sevenfold Account of the Six Days of Genesis. Lorenzo’s protection gave his escapades better cover than his own considerable resources could provide. Since 1483 he had a third of the income from his family’s estates, which along with his Mirandola property he transferred in 1491 to his nephew Gianfrancesco. This other Pico, younger by a few years, became an influential philosopher in his own right—an early voice for reviving scepticism as an instrument of Christian faith.

During this period, as memories of the disastrous Conclusions faded, people still worried about the elder Pico’s orthodoxy. The Kabbalist exegesis of the Bible in the Heptaplus—tame by the author’s earlier standards—was not understated enough to resolve all doubts. Philological conversation with Poliziano was less risky, however, and produced a fragment On Being and the One after 1490. Pico told Poliziano that he envisioned De ente et uno as the first installment of a great work that would find Platonism beneath the surface of Aristotle’s thinking:

those who alienate Aristotle from Plato also alienate themselves from me, for I hold that their views are in harmony.

Not everyone was pleased by the harmonizing—least of all Antonio Cittadini, a professor at Pisa who was still fighting Gianfrancesco about it two years after his uncle’s death.

In 1493 Giovanni achieved reconciliation with a higher authority when Pope Alexander VI pardoned his earlier misadventures. By this time, the prince and his nephew were in the orbit of Girolamo Savonarola, the fiery Dominican who had been elected Prior at the Convent of San Marco, a Florentine landmark. Pico had already known the oracular friar before his sermons persuaded the city to try his theocratic rules. Mesmerized by Savonarola and ever more pious, he gave more properties away, some to the Church and some to his family, as his needs became less worldly. When death took him on 17 November 1494—by poison, some said, where rumors of poisoning were like complaints about runny noses—Florence fell on the same day to French armies. The turmoil of invasion ended the city’s age of glory, illuminated by Pico’s genius—though only intermittently. Ficino, his older friend, occasional rival and a steadier soul, survived him by five years.

2. Works and Reputation

Pico’s major works were the 900 Conclusions in 1486, the Oration written to introduce it, the Apology that defended the Conclusions in 1487, the Heptaplus in 1489 and the Disputations against Predictive Astrology, left unfinished when he died in 1494, without ever making the Oration public.

2.1 Conclusions and Oration

Pico’s modern fame rests on a speech about the dignity of man that he never gave and that got its title after he died. His public debut was the 900 Conclusions, printed without a title near the end of 1486. It was more like a pamphlet than a book, just three dozen sheets of paper and three dozen lists of unsupported statements. These 900 propositions, less than 20 words each, were the only messages sent by the 17,000 words of Pico’s booklet. He called them ‘conclusions’, but he gave them no backing, and some were outrageous theological novelties—including the claim that magic and Kabbalah proved Christ’s divinity. He wrote this proposition, like all the others, in preparation for the debate that he planned to stage in Rome, the capital of Christendom. His flimsy little handout, crudely printed, was also a script and an advertisement. The prince expected to draw a crowd. Instead he drew down the wrath of God through his Vicar on earth, Pope Innocent. Legal proceedings against the Conclusions started. Planning for a disputational spectacle stopped. Years of disgrace and danger began for Pico and his first public work.

He divided the pamphlet into two parts: the first had 402 theses; the second had 498 theses. He took credit and assumed responsibility only for the second part, having listed propositions in the first part under names of other persons and groups of persons who were eminent in philosophy, theology and theosophy. This was the layout of the first part:

  1. Albert the Great
  2. Aquinas
  3. François de Meyronnes
  4. Scotus
  5. Henry of Ghent
  6. Egidio Romano
  7. Ibn Rushd
  8. Ibn Sina
  9. Al-Farabi
  10. Isaac Albalag
  11. Ibn Marwan
  12. Maimonides
  13. Tolletinus
  14. Ibn Bajja
  15. Theophrastus
  16. Ammonius
  17. Simplicius
  18. Alexander
  19. Themistius
  20. Plotinus
  21. Adeland
  22. Porphyry
  23. Iamblichus
  24. Proclus
  25. Pythagoreans
  26. Chaldeans
  27. Egyptians
  28. Kabbalist Jews

And this was the second part, where Pico highlighted his own ambitions more than older authorities:

  1. Concord
  2. Dissent
  3. Novelty
  4. Deviance
  5. Platonism
  6. Causes
  7. Numbers
  8. Chaldeans
  9. Magic
  10. Orphica
  11. Christian Kabbalah

All this was in print before the pope stopped the rash project. To make matters worse, the prince defended his blunder in a recalcitrant Apology whose preface was part of the still unpublished Oration—though not the part that later became famous. Pico’s words in the Conclusions were deeds, and they were reckless. His propositions were performative speech-acts, eristic and illocutionary, not just declarative and endoxic or apodictic. Theatrical combat continued throughout the booklet, despite eye-catching claims about concordia that introduced the second part:

There is no inquiry, natural or theological, where Aristotle and Plato don’t agree in meaning and content (sensu et re) even though they seem to disagree in words (verbis). [Pico, Conclusiones, 1486, 28]

Pico detected philosophical harmony not only in Aristotle versus Plato but also in Ibn Sina versus Ibn Rushd, Aquinas versus Scotus, and other notorious quarrels. He meant his proclamation of concord to be startling. He called it ‘contrarian’ (paradoxus), but it wasn’t original: ancient commentators on Plato and Aristotle had the same view. Simplicius of Cilicia, a Platonist of the sixth century known to Pico, had written that

a worthwhile interpreter of Aristotle’s writings … should examine not just the language (λέξιν) of what he says against Plato … but look also at the meaning (νοῦν) and search out the harmony (συμφωνίαν) between them on most matters. [Simpl. In Cat. 7.23–32, translation by the author of this entry]

Pico chose propositions because he could defend or attack them convincingly, and he stated them in forms that would optimize his advantages—logical and philosophical but also rhetorical. In this disputatious framework, a thesis secundum Thomam, secundum Averroem or secundum Proclum might or might not have been a fair statement of anyone’s position—including Pico’s. Fidelity in presentation was not the prince’s aim; his aim was victory in debate.

The first part of his book attached its conclusions to names of authorities: Aquinas, Ibn Rushd, Proclus, and two dozen others. Readers who saw works by these sages as sources of Pico’s theses were sometimes correct: thinkers named by him had indeed stated some of his conclusions verbatim or nearly so. But words printed under their names seldom presented their teachings clearly, often altered them and sometimes could not have been theirs because of anachronisms or incompatibilities: Pico’s many presentations of authority in the first part of the Conclusions did not simply follow the views of these authors—or his own. The excessive brevity of his propositions, constricted by reflexive secrecy, made it hard to diagnose his intentions or follow his trains of thought.

Most propositions in the Conclusions were scholastic theology; many others were Kabbalah; together this was two-thirds of the book. Kabbalah was unintelligible to Christian theologians, just as their theology horrified the few learned Jews who had studied Kabbalah. The Platonism of late antiquity, from Plotinus through Proclus and his followers, dominated the other third of the book. Ficino had set a high standard for Pico’s Platonic propositions, not just the philosophy but also the philology. It’s safe to say, all in all, that there wasn’t much competent readership in Italy for the prince’s book at the time it was published. Some individuals might have understood it, but not many.

The few Christians whose education had prepared them for Greek texts on Neoplatonic metaphysics—unusual people like Barbaro, Ficino and Poliziano—were developing a new way to read, write, talk and teach, grounded in a philology of ancient languages, that came to be called ‘humanism’—though not until the nineteenth century. Meanwhile, four centuries earlier, there was nothing ‘humanist’ about Pico’s Conclusions, whose content, milieu and presentation were thoroughly medieval. On the Latin Christian side, his authorities had flourished in the thirteenth and early fourteenth centuries. On the Arabic, Aramaic, Hebrew, Jewish, and Muslim side, his texts were earlier, in place before the thirteenth century ended. For Greek thought his mainstay was Proclus from the fifth century.

Only three traditions were prominent in the Conclusions: Kabbalist, Peripatetic, and Platonic. Pico’s Platonism, centered on Proclus and his followers, was post-Hellenistic and medieval, not Hellenic. ‘Peripatetic’ was his label for the scholastic Aristotelianism—Jewish and Muslim as well as Christian—that peaked in the thirteenth century. He explained in the Oration that ‘Kabbalah’ was “the Hebrew word for our ‘reception’”. A related word, ‘tradition’, would have done just as well. As for a tradition called ‘Hermetic’, the Conclusions had nothing good to say. Imitating Proclus, Pico preferred Chaldean prophets and Orphic bards to the Egyptian Hermes.

The prince was so well informed about celebrated Peripatetics—Aquinas, Farabi, Giles of Rome, Henry of Ghent, Ibn Rushd, Ibn Sina, Maimonides, Scotus, and others—that he spotted flaws in their theology and tried to fix them with Platonic metaphysics. His main informant about mistakes made by Christians was Jean Cabrol (Capreolus, d. 1443), a Dominican explicator of Aquinas. Pico owned Cabrol’s huge commentary in an incunable edition of 1483. By that time Cabrol’s Dominican followers had given his work a militant new title, Defensiones, treating it as a manual for Thomism on the attack. Cabrol’s defense of Thomas instructed Pico about the opposition to Thomism, showing him how to express Averroist and nominalist objections to the communis via—his term for the rigidified Thomist consensus. Statements in the Conclusions showed contempt for teachings endorsed by Aquinas. Propositions that insulted the saint by name were among those condemned.

Elia del Medigo surveyed Pico’s path through quarrels about and among Muslims. This learned Jew from Crete introduced him to a Jewish commentary tradition on Ibn Rushd, both in Hebrew and in Arabic. Just as Pico learned how to oppose Thomism from Cabrol, a doctrinaire Thomist, he also learned how to refute criticisms of Averroism from Elia, a zealous Averroist. Philosophers attacked by Ibn Rushd—Farabi, Ibn Bajja, Ibn Sina, and others—were vulnerable voices in Pico’s theses, along with Aquinas, Albertus, and Scotus, also Plato, Plotinus, Porphyry, Proclus, and the Greek commentators.

The Conclusions were, among other things, Pico’s egregious advertisement of his own learning—a polyglot catalog of propositions that challenged orthodoxy and defied common opinion. When he called some of these conclusions paradoxae, he wasn’t thinking of semantic puzzles like the Liar or of Zeno’s arresting tales. His model for contrarian propositions was Cicero’s account of Stoic paradoxes. These provocations, labeled as such, were only a few dozen out of 900 statements, all of them presented as quodlibetal theses like those debated in medieval universities.

Nonetheless, the 900 theses in Pico’s little book were more inflammatory than the 7,000 words of his Oration: the oblique oratory in the speech was conventional as rhetoric and entertaining in its eloquence. Besides, the scandal of papal condemnation in 1487 was old news by 1496, when Gianfrancesco first had the Oration printed in a posthumous collection of his uncle’s works (Commentationes). Pico’s nephew, also a philosopher, was and still is the primary source for stories about his uncle. Giovanni’s silenced oratory embarrassed Gianfrancesco. He recalled that his uncle regretted the speech as a juvenile mistake. For the next several centuries, few of Pico’s admirers challenged this verdict, despite the orator’s continuing fame. Until the Oration charmed post-Kantian historians, it had few readers. But dignitas got plenty of attention before Pico was born

Shortly after 1450, Giannozzo Manetti completed his De dignitate et excellentia hominis. Unlike the Oration, Manetti’s book was actually about dignitas, but as ancient Romans and medieval Christians used the word for ‘rank’, ‘status’, ‘value’, or ‘worth’—not good fits for what Kant would say about Würde as distinct from Wert. Manetti’s dignitas was essentially Christian but slightly secularized by late medieval interest in ancient pagans like Cicero and by changed conditions of life in fifteenth-century Italy. Manetti attacked a twelfth-century treatise On Human Misery by Cardinal Lotario dei Segni, who later became Pope Innocent III. Two contemporaries of Manetti—Antonio da Barga and Bartolomeo Facio—had written less impressively on his topic. These treatments of dignitas were well known, but Pico’s undelivered speech paid no attention to them because dignitas was not his subject. His larger project—advertised by the Conclusions but not well presented—was to convince people that they could save their souls by using magic and Kabbalah to change themselves into angels.

Awareness of the speech—unpublished in Pico’s lifetime—was erratic after he died. Bad publicity lingered from the pope’s denunciation of the Conclusions, which the speech was meant to introduce. Except in the author’s collected works, the Latin text was printed only once before the 1940s, when the first English translation also appeared, just after the first Italian version in 1936. What readers had seen on the title page of the Commentationes in 1496 was just A Very Elegant Oration. By 1530—in the only separately published Latin text of the pre-modern period—these words expanded into On Man by Giovanni Pico della Mirandola, Explaining the Loftier Mysteries of Sacred and Human Philosophy. Meanwhile, the front matter of the 5 collected editions or reprints between 1498 and 1521 stayed with the 1496 formulation, Oratio quaedam elegantissima, which in 1557 finally became On the Dignity of Man in a Basel collection and, in a Venice edition of the same year, A Very Elegant Oration on the High Nobility and Dignity of Man. The words de dignitate hominis had first described the speech, less conspicuously, inside the 1504 edition. Later in 1572 and 1601, two other collections used a new format that no longer displayed contents by title at the front of the book.

2.2 Other Works and Gianfrancesco’s Life

The British Library Catalog, listing about 1300 books by Erasmus printed before 1701, has about 100 contemporary entries for Pico. During the same period, when Marsilio Ficino’s De vita libri tres went through more than 30 editions, Pico’s Oratio—far better known today than Ficino’s Three Books on Life—attracted few publishers. Of the five dozen or so titles by the prince that were printed in this period, about half were collections of letters: the first two, called Golden Letters, were incunables. Letters also appeared in early collections with Pico’s other works: title pages named Ficino and Poliziano as his correspondents, and all of them were durable celebrities.

Pico’s letters succeeded commercially because of the writer’s fame and the needs of readers. Latin was still a medium of learned communication in the late seventeenth century, when Isaac Newton published his Principia in that undead language, and educated people still learned to write by imitating stylists like Pico. His epistolary Latin was elegant, and his fame had lasted. He was renowned as a critic of astrology, as an expert on Kabbalah and as the talented Count Pico—a Phoenix who blazed through a brief life in the triple glare of an old aristocratic society, a new mandarin culture of classical scholarship and, in his last years, the apocalyptic carnival that raged in Savonarola’s Florence. Noble origins, fashionable friends, physical beauty, prodigious learning, capacious memory, scholarly journeys, youthful sins, trouble with the Church, eventual repentance, and a pious death: these were motifs of the family hagiography by his nephew Gianfrancesco that kept Giovanni Pico famous for being famous as the centuries passed.

Because he died so young, the prince finished very little and published less: he neither completed nor published the vernacular Commento; the Conclusions were just bare statements of theses; the preface in the rushed Apology was a piece of the unpublished Oration; On Being and the One, also unpublished, was left over from a plan to harmonize Plato and Aristotle; and Gianfrancesco found the unfinished Disputations bundled with his dead uncle’s papers. The only works that Giovanni sent to a printer while he lived were the Conclusions, the Apology, and the Heptaplus.

The Apology, defending the Conclusions against heresy charges, was Pico’s longest piece of philosophical writing. Mostly it was conventional scholasticism in the manner of Aquinas, Ockham and Scotus. This imprudent book—extensively informed by Cabrol’s Defenses of Aquinas—also relied on Durand de Saint-Pourçain, Henry of Ghent, Jean Quidort, Robert Holcot, and a dozen lesser medieval masters. The Conclusions, in most of its content and all of its presentation, was also thoroughly scholastic. The fashionable classicism of Barbaro and Poliziano made no impression on Pico’s first two printed works, which framed his living reputation—except at home in the Emilia-Romagna and in Tuscany, where people knew him personally. He wrote his two long letters on poetry and philosophical language in the new classical Latin, but few saw them while the writer lived: in later university settings, these brilliant apprentice pieces would have been prize essays.

2.3 Christian Kabbalah and the Heptaplus

Besides the Conclusions and the Apology, the only project that Pico completed for publication in print was the Heptaplus (1489), his Kabbalist commentary on the first 26 verses of Genesis. These lines presented the Account of the Beginning (Ma‘aseh Bereshit), a favorite of Menahem Recanati, Abraham Abulafia, and other Kabbalists known to Pico through learned Italian Jews, especially Flavius Mithridates, Elia del Medigo, and Yohanan Alemanno. They gave him ingredients for a Christianized Kabbalah, a Jewish complement to Ficino’s ancient theology, and he put it on display in the 900 Conclusions: 119 of them, including the final 72, were explicitly Kabbalist and outlandishly so from a Christian point of view.

While Pico tried half-heartedly to harmonize all of Europe’s philosophies, Christianizing Kabbalah was his main project. He found Christology and trinitarian theology in an oral Torah confided to Moses and passed on secretly through Esdras and other sages. Because its origin was Mosaic, Kabbalah was more hallowed than the pagan wisdom that Ficino had traced to Zoroaster and Hermes Trismegistus in ancient Chaldea and Egypt, where Platonic philosophy supposedly had its roots. Pico was the first Christian who had the expertise—including a little Hebrew, Aramaic and possibly Arabic—to make the astonishing claims that he published about Kabbalah as the core of a holier ancient theology.

Books of Kabbalah were being read by the twelfth century, but Christians knew almost nothing about them before Pico. The Kabbalah that he revealed to Latin Europe was a theory as well as a practice—biblical hermeneutics with devotional intent. For some Kabbalists, then as now, textual studies underwrote a spiritual practice whose aim was mystical ascent and prophetic ecstasy achieved by ritual techniques, including magic and theurgy. Kabbalists believed that the Hidden God, the No-End, revealed himself not only in the Bible but also through ten aspects, attributes or emanations, the sefirot or ‘numberings’ of God’s myriad faces. Personalized in myths, visualized in images and symbolized by letters and numbers, the sefirot acted in theosophical dramas that framed devotional practices. Names of God that resonated in scripture were the other main focus of Kabbalah.

link to extended description below

Figure 1: Sefirot in the Standard Array. [An extended description of figure 1 is in the supplement.]

The Bible’s Hebrew text was God’s speech, infinite in meaning. Kabbalists took their bearings even from its smallest particles—not only the sacred words but also their letters (which were also numbers) and even the shapes of letters. God’s names were the most potent words; the holiest of them, the Tetragrammaton, could not be spoken. Written as יהוה (yhwh), the unutterable Name was read aloud as Adonai, a speakable name like Elohim, Ehyeh, El Shaddai, and others used of God in the Hebrew Bible. Names of the sefirot, unknown as such to scripture, were also words of power. They were names not of God, however, but of God’s manifestations, some more remote than others.

The Creator stayed hidden in his highest essence. Creatures below cognized the No-End only in descent from his secret heights. His lowest downward moments filled the world of human awareness with perceptible creatures. The first moments, far beyond the reach of ordinary cognition, were the ten sefirot. Much of the literature of Kabbalah described these numberings as shown in Figure 1: there were ten of them, S1 through S10, and fruit on the branches of this tree had many names. Common designations of S4, for example, were Gedullah and Hesed, meaning Greatness and Love or Piety, Latinized as Amor or Pietas by Pico’s instructors in Kabbalah. A divine name associated with S4 was El, but Kabbalists used many other words and names (Abraham, Michael, the South, Water) to describe S4 and other sefirot: Pico’s term was numerationes, which he learned from his main informant, the learned Jew and clever forger who called himself Flavius Mithridates.

Pico was the first Christian who described Kabbalah in detail or treated it as worthwhile, hoping to persuade other Christians that this Jewish mysticism could help save their souls. Flavius, his prolific helper and deceiver, translated and mistranslated thousands of pages of Kabbalah from Aramaic and Hebrew into Latin. To make his work pleasing to Pico, Flavius added words and phrases—not found in the originals—that carried Christian messages. This convert to Christianity was a talented linguist who had worked at the Vatican. His translations were almost entirely sound; otherwise, the faking would have been obvious.

Portions of the Oration, drawing on this tainted material, were informed by Kabbalah in ways that no contemporary Christian could have noticed—especially if they lacked clues provided by more than a hundred theses in the Conclusions. Pico’s esoteric intentions, proclaimed emphatically in the unpublished Oration and publicized by impenetrable propositions in the Conclusions, distanced his project not only from post-Cartesian philosophies in Anglophonia and elsewhere but also from earlier European systems outside the Platonic tradition. Wishing not just to mystify but also to provoke, Pico succeeded and paid the price of his Church’s anger.

Theology, spirituality and philosophy—all in the broadest sense—were the main content of Pico’s Kabbalah, which showed (or hinted) how God revealed himself in the sefirot, in divine names and in words of scripture. In 72 Kabbalist theses at the finale of the Conclusions, this revelation became Christology and trinitarian theology. From a Kabbalist point of view, the sefirot and the divine names were characters in stories about theology, cosmology, anthropology and angelology; major themes were exile, death, atonement and redemption, tales told by Jews that Pico applied to the Trinity, with Jesus as the messianic hero of a new theosophy and the focus of a liturgy strange to Christians.

Devotions advocated by the Conclusions were prayer and ritual as preparations for ecstasy and ascent to mystical union with God. This practical theosophy was also the main message of the Oration, where Pico’s ladder up to divinity had rungs of magic and theurgy. Propositions in the Conclusions confirmed this endorsement of magic and showed in more detail than the speech why Pico linked magic with Kabbalah. He saw the combination as a pious practice which—like the higher theurgy of Iamblichus and other Platonic philosophers—explored routes to God that were usually hidden. The practice of Kabbalah started with theory because these channels, concealed in scripture, had to be disclosed and interpreted before anyone could reconnoiter them: spiritual progress relied on hermeneutics.

Kabbalist exegesis was the most obscure material in the Conclusions, especially Pico’s accounts of Hebrew words and letters. Language was his gateway to wisdom, and elements of language were letters and numbers that proliferated in secret codes. Pico’s genius and ambition, which the Church deplored as impudence, attracted him to this challenge, a cryptic theology of the hidden word, whose enigmas and ambiguities fed his hunger for the esoteric. The Kabbalist theology in the Conclusions, hence the Kabbalah promoted by the Oration, was deliberately mystifying but finally Christological and trinitarian. Prior exhibitions of Kabbalah in support of Pico’s grand theory focused on particular biblical texts, whose messages he also excavated from the gentile wisdom of ancient theologians—Orpheus, Pythagoras, Zoroaster and Chaldean prophets, though not the Egyptian Hermes.

In the Heptaplus of 1489 readers now recognize the Kabbalist voice of the Conclusions: Pico’s earlier works since the Commento of 1485 have prepared them to hear it. These impetuous texts advertised Kabbalah brazenly, unlike the cautious Heptaplus, and they damaged Pico with enemies in Rome more than they helped him with friends in Florence—Ficino, Poliziano and others. Roberto Salviati, a learned Florentine friend of the prince, called the Heptaplus “the first fruits of his studies” when he arranged to have it printed [Pico, De hominis dignitate, Heptaplus (10), 168]. Was Salviati embarrassed by earlier works—the Commento, Conclusions, and Apology? It’s likelier that he thought them forgettable than that he knew nothing about them. But simple ignorance explains silence about the unpublished Oration: Pico’s nephew testified that even his uncle kept quiet about it. Readers disturbed by the Kabbalah in the Conclusions reacted predictably, but the Heptaplus was less threatening because the author had sanitized it. After nearly 20 years, Crofton Black’s book (2006) is still the best account of the Heptaplus.

Although the creation narrative was the topic of Patristic commentaries by Ambrose and Basil of Caesarea, the first verses of Genesis, examined in the Heptaplus, interested fewer Christian interpreters than passages of Job or the Psalms. Like all scripture, the opening of Genesis was thought to have three layers of meaning—allegorical, tropological, and anagogical—beyond a literal or ‘historical’ sense: “history talks about events”, according to the commentators,

allegory about how one thing is understood from another, tropology discusses morals, … and anagogy is the spiritual meaning … that leads to higher things. [Biblia latina cum glossa ordinaria (1480), Gen. prol. 1:6]

But the Heptaplus presented a new kind of allegory, a method derived from the structure of creation itself and directed toward a new type of anagogy, which was mystical ascent to the Godhead through Kabbalah.

Pico provided a key to this practical exegesis only in the last part of the Heptaplus, which looked like an appendix tacked on at the end—just another showing of virtuoso skill in biblical languages. But to learned Jews of the day—Kabbalists or not—Pico’s analysis of the Hebrew letters of the first word of Genesis (Bereshit, “In the beginning”) would have seemed crude. There was nothing exotic in it except for Christians, and for them the effect would have been superficial—dazzling them with art.

The arcane ending of the Heptaplus that looked extraneous was actually a grand finale. Pico hinted at a secret that no Christian of his day could have known: that Moses himself, whose words recorded the creation story, had passed through 49 Gates of Understanding—7 × 7 sefirotic stations—on his way to a 50th Gate, the supreme and final portal to union with God. The 49 prior passages traversed vestibules of creation, demonstrating Pico’s allegorical method by exemplifying it: the universe of existence was also a universe of understanding that showed a path to mystical union, and the map was indeed the terrain.

Without explaining the Gates, the Conclusions said enough about them so that later scholars—Johann Reuchlin especially—could find paths through Kabbalah and try to follow them. Short and schematic directions, unlike Kabbalah in both ways, would go like this: Wisdom, the second sefirah (S2 in Figure 1), built a palace in eternity for Intelligence at S3 and carved 50 Gates there, 7 to be opened at each of the 7 lower sefirot, S4 through S10, leaving another Gate beyond and still shut. The 50 Gates, also called the Jubilee, corresponded to the 50-year festival ordained in Leviticus and also to a Great Jubilee of 50,000 years, when 7 sabbatical cycles or weeks of 7,000 years came to an end. After a final age when the lower sefirot collapsed into S3, the millenarian cycle restarted, having been completed in the previous thousand years—in the Sabbath of the Shekinah, God’s Dwelling at S10. This Sabbath, a 7th day of rest after 6 days of creating, was Pico’s ultimate allegory of mystical union, a secret encoded not only in the letters of Bereshit but also in the 7-fold structure of the Heptaplus itself.

But who knew or could have known? In 1489, when Pico published the Heptaplus, its only competent readers in Italy were a few learned Jews who knew Latin—the very voices of Aramaic and Hebrew who had told the prince enough about Kabbalah to load his Conclusions with it. In most of the Heptaplus, however, even where the book’s structure and content plainly depended on Kabbalah, Pico kept the mysteries hidden until the final exposition of Bereshit that could only have baffled Christian readers and scandalized them. As in earlier works, Pico intended to mystify. He believed, and he said, that plain language would defile the holiest wisdom. He uncovered God’s secrets only for an elite clever enough to unravel his allegories and break the ciphers that concealed them. A salient fact and also a surprise—given European and Anglophone conceptions of philosophy—is that Pico thought of this mystification as philosophical and claimed passionately to be a philosopher.

2.4 Oratory but not Dignity

In the first few pages of the Oration—which eventually confused more people in more languages than any other Latin text of its time—the Creator tells Adam that he, alone of all creatures, can make himself what he wants to be. This overture misled Wilhelm Tennemann (1761–1819), a Kantian historian of philosophy: like others after him, he treated Pico’s stirring prelude as evidence of a morality grounded, like Kant’s, in human freedom and dignity. This miscarried reading of the speech gathered strength from the Enlightenment, acquired a romantic aura and in 1860 became thematic for a new partition of cultural history, the Renaissance, established by Jacob Burckhardt. Half a century later, Ernst Cassirer—an eminent Neo-Kantian—authenticated the Oration as a modern secular gospel. Nazis drove Cassirer and Paul Kristeller, also a Kantian Jew, to North America, where they brought Burckhardt’s Renaissance and Pico’s oratory to thrive after World War II in college textbooks on ‘Western Civilization’. Meanwhile, in Fascist Italy, just before Mussolini’s racial laws were enforced, Eugenio Garin had published his foundational study of Pico (Garin 1937).

The opening of the Oration is the most conspicuous part of the speech, praised by Garin and others as a declaration of dignity, freedom and ‘humanism’. Assured by initial statements that we can be what we want to be, we are then told—contrary to Garin’s view and the usual reading—that what we ought to be isn’t human at all. Our task is to become angels: bodiless, sexless and ultimately—that most unromantic of all conditions—selfless in the strictest sense. Living like Cherubs, not quite the highest angels, was the first post-human peak to be scaled. To go there, we must shed not only the gendered bodies that imprison us but also identities and personalities that distinguish every one of us from God and from everyone else. Personal extinction by mystical union with God was Pico’s goal: for people to be divinized, selves had to be discarded. “Let a holy ambition possess our spirit”, he wrote,

let us climb for the heights, panting; and let us strive with all our might to reach them, since we can do it if we will it. Let us scorn the things of earth, let us despise those of heaven, and then, leaving behind whatever belongs to the world, let us fly up to the hypercosmic court nearest the most exalted divinity…. As we emulate the Cherubic life on earth, checking the impulses of the emotions through moral knowledge, dispelling the darkness of reason through dialectic, let us cleanse the soul by washing away the dirt of ignorance and vice so that emotions will not rage in fury nor reason go mad and foolish. Then let us flood the soul, purified and well tempered, with the light of natural philosophy so that finally we may perfect it with knowledge of divinity…. [Then] we will fully enjoy the peace that we have longed for—the holiest peace, the unbreakable bond, the friendship of the single-souled wherein all our spirits do not so much converge in the one mind above every mind as in some unsayable way emerge as absolutely one. This is that friendship which the Pythagoreans say is the end of all philosophy. This is that peace which God gives on high and angels descending to earth have announced to men of good will so that through this peace these same men, ascending to heaven, might be made into angels…. Ever forgetful of herself, [the soul] will wish to die in herself that she might live in her spouse, in whose sight the death of his saints is most precious—death, I say, if one should use the word ‘death’ for that fullness of life whose contemplation the sages have said is the aim of philosophy…. Lifted now to the topmost height of her watchtower, for all eternity looking out without interruption over what is, what will be and what has been, we shall sing prophecies like Phoebus, and, gazing up at primeval beauty, we shall be its winged lovers, until at last, with a love that cannot be described, driven wild by desire and transported beyond ourselves like burning Seraphs, full of divine power, we shall be ourselves no longer, but shall be Him, the very one who made us. [Pico, Oration, (39), 88–102]

At the lowest level of this self-annihilating paideia, the initiate began as a student of philosophy, learning ethics, logic, natural philosophy and theology and then ascending, through arcana of magic and Kabbalah, to drown the self in God’s bottomless lake. This was not a Kantian project, and the Oration on the Dignity of Man that located the human condition in freedom and dignity was written—and still is being written—by us post-Kantians, not by Giovanni Pico.

The outline of the Oration below was also not Pico’s. Its 7 parts may or may not have been his plan. But the deep structure of the Conclusions was numerological, and the Heptaplus, by its title and organization, showed that 7 was a special number for the prince—as for so many stewards of secrets. The book’s subtitle was a Sevenfold Account of the Six Days of Genesis, plainly an invitation to calculate arithmetic mysteries. In 1489 the Heptaplus invoked a theme—ascending to supreme happiness—that had occupied Pico for years, at least since he started the Commento. So it wouldn’t be surprising if hebdomads in the Heptaplus reflected earlier statements, including the Oration, which can be analyzed as follows:

  1. Humans are amazing because they can choose to change what they are.
  2. To choose well, however, they must change into angels.
  3. And to emulate angels, they must live like Cherubs.
  4. Humans can learn this lesson from ancient saints:
    1. Paul and Dionysius,
    2. Jacob,
    3. Job,
    4. Moses,
    5. Orpheus, Plato, Plotinus, Socrates and other gentiles,
    6. Pythagoras,
    7. Abraham, Chaldeans, Jeremiah and Zoroaster.
  5. Because philosophy leads to the Cherubic life, Pico proclaims himself a philosopher.
  6. Philosophy has informed him about new practices, including magic and Kabbalah.
  7. Assured of philosophy’s benefits, Pico will ignore his critics and debate a philosophy of his own.

A curriculum reviewed 7 times in the middle of the Oration, at step 4 of 7, taught lessons leading to mystical union with God. Ancient Platonists discussed this regimen, and Church Fathers absorbed it into Christian piety. Books of Kabbalah gave similar instructions. Students started with moral philosophy and then moved up through dialectic and natural philosophy toward theology until discursive thought dissolved in ecstasy, pure contemplation and finally unification. Stages of Pico’s paideia were

  1. moral philosophy
  2. dialectic
  3. natural philosophy
  4. theology
  5. magic
  6. Kabbalah
  7. mystical union

Magic and Kabbalah were preliminary but necessary. Magic, propelling the soul through the heavens toward supercelestial divinity, fueled a transition from natural philosophy to natural theology and beyond. And then Kabbalah, rising above discursive theology, climbing higher than magic, changed embodied humans into pure spirits: entirely purged of matter, these souls were then fit for henôsis—absolute unification with God. The philosophy behind this self-abnegating spirituality went back to pagan commentators on Aristotle. Ibn Sina, Ibn Rushd and other Muslim and Jewish sages made it more explicit. Pico’s advice—in philosophical terms that were controversial yet more familiar to Christians than Kabbalah—was for human persons to conjoin with the Agent Intellect.

2.5 Being and the One and Astrology

The last major item in Pico’s bibliography, the Disputations Against Astrology, is textually problematic—like the prince’s letters—because Gianfrancesco may have meddled with both. Otherwise, the best account of the Disputations is Anthony Grafton’s article, listed in Quaquarelli and Zanardi’s bibliography.

Pico’s big book was unwelcoming—unfinished, ragged presentation, sources technical and obscure. Much of it repeated ancient and medieval objections to astrology. Ptolemy’s doubts about particular types of prediction, for example, turned into a general restriction on celestial influence, which was too diffuse or too slight to produce reliable foreknowledge. Astrologers were exposed for contradicting themselves and for violating canons of reason and experience that natural philosophy relied on. Complaints restated by Pico—epistemic, logical, methodological and observational—had been made even before ancient sceptics recorded their characteristic objections. The prince’s innovation, without entirely rejecting astrology, was to weaponize philology against it.

Astrology’s credibility rested on its pedigree—descent through the ages from ancient Chaldea and Egypt. The Oration and Conclusions verified this genealogy and sanctified it with Kabbalah, a tradition that was sacred, not just venerable. Like Kabbalah and because of its age, astrology could be confirmed (or disconfirmed) by the new classicism that linked authority with antiquity. Astrology’s record of watching planets and stars was an experience of deep time that certified its findings, compiled over the millennia.

But the Disputations that Pico died too soon to finish reformed this static mytho-history by bringing it down to earth and back to life with new evidence. Informed by breakthroughs in biblical and secular chronology, he relocated primordial icons like Zoroaster in living landscapes of human time, subjecting them to criticism that later experts would call ‘historical’. And yet Pico’s critical sense was far from modern. When he attacked the stargazers as superstitious, he mistook strengths for weaknesses and dismissed their mathematical skills as credulity. The arithmetic in his own Conclusions was numerology, and his treatment of mathematics was generally unprogressive—more like Aristotle’s attitude than Plato’s. But Kepler noticed the Disputations, and philologists, weighing Pico’s doubts about exotic sages, took the shine off the bronze of prisca theologia.

Ficino’s ancient theology was a Platonic historiography. But the prince’s least eccentric work of philosophy took an Aristotelian position against a Platonic distinction between being and the One that made the One higher than being in the order of the All. Since Ficino supported just such a distinction, Pico’s fragment On Being and the One challenged the senior philosopher, who saw it that way and objected politely. A larger purpose, harmonizing Aristotle with Plato, would have been germane. But the Conclusions had subverted its own assertion of concordia just after stating it. Even if Pico hadn’t defaced his irenic coinage, he wasn’t Platonic enough to suit Ficino, just as he wasn’t Aristotelian enough for doctrinaire Aristotelians.

The future marched to his music, however, if not under a banner of concordia. Friends of the prince—Barbaro, Ficino, Poliziano and others—promoted the philology that informed later Aristotelians about all the ancient schools: not just Platonists but also Epicureans, Pre-Socratics, Sceptics, Stoics and others. Later, during the Enlightenment, philosophers scrutinized old texts recently recovered to enforce the comparative ‘eclectic’ criticism promulgated by Jacob Brucker and popularized by the Encyclopédie. Brucker and the philosophes despised Pico’s concordia, mocking it as the ‘syncretism’ that muddled eclectic reasoning.

Ficino’s geniality had encouraged Pico’s urge to harmonize, and his half-baked concordia was more than just compatible with the ancient theology that was Ficino’s way of Christianizing pagan wisdom. The warm personal language of correspondence between the two philosophers shows Ficino welcoming Pico as a junior ally. But Ficino’s letters, which he published in 1495, testify better to his friendship with Pico than Pico’s letters. Gianfrancesco published them a year later, after preparing the Disputations for the press at the same time. Comparing the two epistolaries suggests that the younger Pico, at least as close to Savonarola as his uncle, intervened to select letters by the elder Pico—those that made it into the collected works of 1496 overseen by the nephew—and arranged them to match the pious Life that introduced the whole collection.

The all too human protagonist of the Life was a Savonarolan saint who renounced the world, the flesh and the devil just in time. This was not the eager Pico who had hunted for fame in Rome a few years before and dared the world in a failed philosophical extravaganza; nor the cocksure prince who bungled an attempt to carry off a woman whose husband was named Medici—no less; nor the unsettled journeyman thinker calmed by Ficino’s bantering in letters decorated with astro-mythology. The disasters of 1487 may be enough to explain Pico’s jarring reversal on astrology in the Disputations, also his muffling of Kabbalah in the Heptaplus. But since Gianfrancesco, who edited the Disputations, also edited and chose letters to support a tendentious Life of his uncle, and since the nephew was not just a devout fideist but also a prodigiously productive scholar and original thinker, the Disputations may have been another pendant to Gianfrancesco’s Life of Pico—dubious in that setting as proof of penitence when his uncle’s meteor flamed out.

Bibliography

A. Primary Literature

In 1496, the Pico of the Commentationes (5) was his nephew’s creation. Now, more than five centuries later, Pico on the internet—even farther from his time and place—is an artifact of the last century’s scholarship, whose even older philosophical attitudes were shaped by Kant and Hegel. The Commentationes, edited posthumously by Gianfrancesco Pico, was the first printed collection of works by his uncle. Another early collection is (6)—often cited but not reliable. There is no complete modern set of vernacular translations based on trustworthy Latin texts.

The I Tatti Renaissance Library (ITRL), edited by James Hankins for Harvard University Press, has begun filling this gap with the Oration (39) in an English translation of a Latin text indebted to Bausi’s Italian edition (27). While Pico lived the speech was never printed. The first translation (7)—into German—waited until 1905. Italian versions [(8), (9)] followed during the Fascist period, and then another one (22) in 1995 under Silvio Berlusconi’s imprint. Modern versions in other languages are (14), (31), and (34). But (11), an Oration translated by Elizabeth Forbes, has been Pico’s main vehicle in English. Introduced by Kristeller, this version has been in print for 76 years, a best seller in the North American textbook market after Burckhardt, Cassirer, and Giovanni Gentile had made the prince’s speech famous.

The first book that Pico had printed was his 900 Conclusions, forthcoming in an ITRL edition (40); see other texts and translations in (20), (25), (26), (35), (36), and (38). Fornaciari’s Italian version (32) of Pico’s Apology (3)—which defended the condemned Conclusions—includes a Latin text. Along with the Oration, (14) provides English translations of De ente et uno and the Heptaplus, whose first edition was (4); see (15) for another English Heptaplus. Pico never finished De ente et uno or had it printed: Gianfrancesco published the Latin text in (5); Toussaint’s edition (21) provides a French translation; the translation by Bacchelli and Ebgi (33) is Italian. Eugenio Garin edited the large, unfinished and unpublished Disputations (12): better understanding of this consequential but bulky and difficult work awaits an improved edition and a vernacular translation.

For the smaller Commento—a favorite today left unfinished by the author and unpublished—see (16), (17), (18), and (28). The Latin text of Pico’s early letter in defense of philosophical terminology is in (37): see (13) for an English rendering. Minor works unpublished in his lifetime are (19) and (24). The Latin text and an English translation of Gianfrancesco’s Life is in (39) and in (23), which also contains prayers and religious remarks by Giovanni.

  1. Conclusiones dcccc publice disputandae, Rome: Eucharius Silber, 1486.
  2. Conclusiones dcccc publice disputandae, Ingolstadt: Printer of Lescherius, Rhetorica (Bartholomaeus Golsch?), c. 1487.
  3. Apologia conclusionum suorum, Naples: Francesco del Tuppo, 1487.
  4. Heptaplus Iohannis Pici Mirandulae de septiformi sex dierum Geneseos enarratione ad Laurentium Medicem, Florence: Bartolomeo de’ Libri, c. 1489.
  5. Commentationes Ioannis Pici Mirandulae in hoc volumine contenta, quibus anteponitur vita per Iohannem Franciscum illustris principis Galeotti Pici filium conscripta…, Bologna: Benedictus Hectoris, 1496.
  6. Opera omnia, reprint of the Basel 1557 edition, Hildesheim: Olms, 1969.
  7. Ausgewählte Schriften, Arthur Liebert (trans.), Jena: Diederichs, 1905.
  8. La Filosofia di Pico della Mirandola, Giovanni Semprini (trans.), Milan: Libreria Lombarda, 1936.
  9. Dignità dell’uomo [De hominis dignitate], Bruno Cicognani (trans.), Florence: LeMonnier, 1943.
  10. De hominis dignitate, Heptaplus, De ente et uno e scritti vari (Edizione nazionale dei classici del pensiero italiano, 1), Eugenio Garin (ed.), Florence: Vallechi, 1942.
  11. “Oration on the Dignity of Man”, Elizabeth Livermore Forbes (trans.), in The Renaissance Philosophy of Man, Ernst Cassirer, Paul Kristeller and John Randall (eds), Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1948.
  12. Disputationes adversus astrologiam divinatricem, Eugenio Garin (ed.), Florence: Vallechi, 1946, 1952.
  13. [Letter to Barbaro] in “Giovanni Pico della Mirandola on the Conflict of Philosophy and Rhetoric” by Quirinus Breen, Journal of the History of Ideas, 13(3): 384–412 (pages 394–402 for the letter itself). doi:10.2307/2707604
  14. On the Dignity of Man; On Being and the One; Heptaplus, Charles Glenn Wallis, Paul J. W. Miller, and Douglas Carmichael, Indianapolis, IN: Bobbs-Merrill, 1965.
  15. Heptaplus: or, Discourse on the Seven Days of Creation, Jessie Brewe McGaw (trans.), New York: Philosophical Library, 1977.
  16. Commentary on a canzone of Benivieni, Sears Jayne (trans.), New York: Lang, 1984.
  17. Commentary on a Poem of Platonic Love, Douglas Carmichael (trans.), Lanham, MD: University Press of America, 1986.
  18. Commento (in French, Collection Contemplation), Stéphane Toussaint (ed./trans.), Lausanne: L’Age de l’Homme, 1989.
  19. Sonetti (Collezione di poesia, 243), Giorgio Dilemmi (ed.), Torino: Einaudi, 1994.
  20. Conclusiones nongentae: Le novecento tesi dell’anno 1486, Albano Biondi (ed./trans. [to Italian]), Florence, Olschki, 1995.
  21. L’Esprit du Quattrocento: Pic de la Mirandole: le De ente et uno et réponses à Antonio Cittadini, Stéphane Toussaint (ed./trans.), Paris: Champion, 1995.
  22. De hominis dignitate: La dignità dell’uomo, Carlo Carena (trans.), Milan: Silvio Berlusconi Editore, 1995.
  23. Pico della Mirandola, Gianfrancesco, “Life of Pico”, Thomas More (trans.) c. 1510, in English Poems, Life of Pico, The Last Thing (The Yale Edition of The Complete Works of St. Thomas More, volume 1), Anthony S. G. Edwards, Clarence H. Miller, and Katherine Gardiner Rodgers (eds/trans), New Haven, CT: Yale University Press, 1997.
  24. Expositiones in Psalmos, Antonino Raspanti (ed.), Giacomo Raspanti (ed./trans.), Florence: Olschki, 1997.
  25. Syncretism in the West: Pico’s 900 Theses (1486): The Evolution of Traditional Religious and Philosophical Systems (Medieval & Renaissance Texts & Studies, 167), Stephen Farmer (ed./trans.), Tempe: MRTS, 1998.
  26. 900 Conclusions philosophiques, cabalistiques e théologiques, Bertrand Schefer (ed./trans.) , Paris: Allia, 1999.
  27. Discorso sulla dignità dell’uomo, Francesco Bausi (ed./trans.), Parma: Fondazione Pietro Bembo, 2003.
  28. Kommentar zu einem Lied der Liebe, italienisch-deutsch, Thorsten Bürklin (ed./trans.). Hamburg: Felix Meiner, 2001.
  29. Oeuvres philosophiques: Texte Latin, traduction et notes, Olivier Boulnois and Giuseppe Tognon (eds/trans), 3rd ed., Paris: Presses Universitaires de France, 1993.
  30. Über das Seiende und das Eine: De ente et uno, Richard Blum et al. (eds/trans), Hamburg: Meiner, 2006.
  31. De la dignité de l’homme (Oratio de hominis dignitate), Yyes Hersant (ed./trans.), 5th ed., Paris: Éditions de l’Éclat, 2008.
  32. Apologia: L’Autodifesa di Pico di fronte al Tribunale dell’Inquisizione, Paolo Fornaciari (ed./trans.), Florence: Edizioni del Galluzzo, 2010.
  33. Dell’ente et uno con le obiezioni di Antonio Cittadini e le risposte di Giovanni Pico della Mirandola, Francesco Bacchelli and Raphael Ebgi (eds/trans), Milan: Bompiani, 2010.
  34. Oration on the Dignity of Man: A New Translation and Commentary, Francesco Borghesi, Michael Papio, and Massimo Riva (eds/trans), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2012. doi:10.1017/CBO9781139059565
  35. Der Mensch: eine geisteswissenschaftliche Zusammenschau. Die 900 Thesen Giovanni Pico della Mirandolas in ihrem Kontext lateinisch-deutsche Ausgabe, Christian Albrecht May (ed./trans.), Hamburg: tredition, 2017.
  36. Les 900 conclusions, Delphine Viellard (ed./trans.), Paris: Les Belles Lettres. 2017.
  37. Lettere: Edizione critica, Francesco Borghesi (ed.), Florence: Olschki, 2018.
  38. Neunhundert Thesen, Nikolaus Egel (ed./trans.), Hamburg: Felix Meiner, 2018.
  39. Pico della Mirandola, Gianfrancesco, Life of Giovanni Pico della Mirandola (I Tatti Renaissance Library 93), includes Giovanni Pico, Oration, edited and translated by Brian Copenhaver with Michael Allen, Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press, 2022. Latin and English.
  40. 900 Conclusions (I Tatti Renaissance Library 100), Brian Copenhaver (ed./trans.), Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press, forthcoming (planned 2025).

Other Primary Literature

  • Manetti, Giannozzo, c. 1450, De dignitate et excellentia hominis. Translated as On Human Worth and Excellence (I Tatti Renaissance Library 85), Brian Copenhaver (ed./trans.), Cambridge MA: Harvard University Press, 2018.
  • Biblia latina cum glossa ordinaria, ed. M. Morard, based on the edition of Adolf Rusch and Antonio Koberger, Strasbourg, 1480.

B. Bibliographies

The bibliography of primary and secondary literature by Quaquarelli and Zanardi lists more than 700 studies after 1899 but only 160 for the preceding century, when even Italian scholars came late to the prince and not in large numbers:

  • Quaquarelli, Leonardo and Zita Zanardi, 2005, Pichiana: Bibliografia delle edizioni e degli studi (Studi pichiani 10), Florence: Olschki.

See the additions in:

  • Quaquarelli, Leonardo and Michael Dougherty, 2007, Pichiana: Bibliografia del xix e xx secolo, Florence: Olschki.

C. Secondary Literature

For more recent items (and a few less recent) not mentioned in Quaquarelli and Zanardi, see the list that follows, also the on-line bibliography compiled and maintained by Michael Dougherty at https://www.mvdougherty.com/pico.htm.

  • Bacchelli, Franco, 2015, “Giovanni Pico, conte della Mirandola e Concordia”. Dizionario Biografico degli Italiani, vol. 83. [Bacchelli 2015 available online]
  • Bianchi, Luca, 2007, “Pierre Garsias, adversaire de Jean Pic de la Mirandole, entre nominalisme et ‘via communis’”, Archives d’histoire doctrinale et littéraire du Moyen Âge, 74: 85–108. doi:10.3917/ahdlm.074.0085
  • Black, Crofton, 2006, Pico’s Heptaplus and Biblical Hermeneutics (Studies in Medieval and Reformation Traditions 116), Leiden/Boston: Brill. doi:10.1163/9789047410645
  • Blum, Paul Richard, 2002, “Eintracht und Religion bei Giovanni Pico della Mirandola”, in Suche nach Frieden: Politische Ethik in der frühen Neuzeit, Bd 2 (Theologie und Frieden 20), Norbert Brieskorn and Markus Riedenauer (eds), Stuttgart: Kohlhammer, 29–46.
  • Busi, Giulio, 2006, “Who Does Not Wonder at This Chameleon? The Kabbalistic Library of Giovanni Pico Della Mirandola”, in Hebrew to Latin, Latin to Hebrew: The Mirroring of Two Cultures in the Age of Humanism: Colloqium Held at the Warburg Institute, London, October 18–19, 2004 (Berlin Studies in Judaism 1), Giulio Busi (ed.), Torino: Nino Aragno, 167–196.
  • Busi, Giulio and Raphael Ebgi (eds), 2014, Giovanni Pico della Mirandola: Mito, Magia, Qabbalah (I millenni), Torino: Giulio Einaudi editore.
  • Campanini, Saverio, 2008, “Guglielmo Raimondo Moncada (alias Flavio Mitridate), tradutorre di opere cabbalistiche”, in Perani and Pepi 2008: 49–88.
  • –––, 2012, “El’azar da Worms nelle traduzioni di Flavio Mitridate per Pico della Mirandola”, in Perani and Corazzol 2012: 47–79.
  • –––, 2021, “Receptum est in recipiente per modum recipientis: Traces of the Liber de causis in Early Kabbalah”, in Reading Proclus and the “Book of Causes”, Volume 2 (Studies in Platonism, Neoplatonism, and the Platonic tradition 26), Dragos Calma (ed.), Leiden/Boston: Brill, 455–479. doi:10.1163/9789004440685_020
  • Caroti, Stefano, 2005, “Note sulle fonti medievali di Pico della Mirandola”, Giornale Critico della Filosofia Italiana, (Series 7) 84: 60–92.
  • Copenhaver, Brian P., 1999, “Number, Shape, and Meaning in Pico’s Christian Cabala: The Upright Tsade, The Closed Mem, and the Gaping Jaws of Azazel”, in Natural Particulars: Nature and the Disciplines in Renaissance Europe (Dibner Institute Studies in the History of Science and Technology), Anthony Grafton and Nancy G. Siraisi (eds), Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 25–76 (ch. 1).
  • –––, 2015a, Magic in Western Culture: From Antiquity to the Enlightenment, New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9781107707450
  • –––, 2015b, The Book of Magic: From Antiquity to the Enlightenment, London: Penguin.
  • –––, 2019, Magic and the Dignity of Man: Pico della Mirandola and his Oration in Modern Memory, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press. doi:10.4159/9780674242173
  • –––, 2022, Pico della Mirandola on Trial: Heresy, Freedom, and Philosophy, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780192858375.001.0001
  • –––, 2023, “Pico’s Conclusions: Setting, Structure, Text, Sources and Aims”, Journal of the Warburg and Courtauld Institutes, 86: 57–107. doi:10.1086/725098
  • –––, 2024, “From 737 Conclusions by Jean Cabrol to Giovanni Pico’s 900 Conclusions”, Mediterranea.: International Journal on the Transfer of Knowledge, 9: 53–105. doi:10.21071/mijtk.v9i.16396
  • Copenhaver, Brian and Daniel Stein Kokin, 2014, “Egidio da Viterbo’s Book on Hebrew Letters: Christian Kabbalah in Papal Rome”, Renaissance Quarterly, 67(1): 1–42. doi:10.1086/676151
  • Corazzol, Giacomo, 2013, “Le fonti ‘caldaiche’ dell’Oratio: indagine sui presupposti cabbalistici della concezione pichiana dell’uomo”, Accademia. Revue de la Société Marsile Ficin, 15: 9–62.
  • Dietz, Luc, 2005, “De omni re scibili—et de quibusdam aliis: A New Attempt at Understanding Pico’s 900 Theses”, Neulateinisches Jahrbuch: Journal of Neo-Latin Language and Literature, 7: 295–301.
  • Dougherty, M. V. (ed.), 2008, Pico della Mirandola: New Essays, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. Includes contributions by Michael Allen, Richard Blum, Francesco Borghesi, Michael Dougherty, Jill Kraye, Sheila Rabin, Carl Still and Michael Sudduth. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511619274
  • Ebgi, Raphael, 2024, Sette: Le avventure di un simbolo, Bolgna: Il Mulino.
  • Edelheit, Amos, 2007, “The Scholastic Theology of Giovanni Pico della Mirandola: Between Biblical Faith and Academic Scepticism”, Recherches de théologie et philosophie médiévales, 74: 523–570.
  • –––, 2008, Ficino, Pico and Savonarola: The Evolution of Humanist Theology 1461/2–1498 (The Medieval Mediterranean, 78), Leiden/Boston: Brill. doi:10.1163/ej.9789004166677.i-503
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