Plotinus

First published Wed Sep 25, 2024

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Paul Kalligas replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Plotinus’ philosophy represents one of the supreme intellectual achievements of the period that has come to be called “Late Antiquity”. Plotinus is generally regarded as the founder of Late Antique Platonism, sometimes termed “Neoplatonism”, a school of thought that, while claiming to be the inheritor of the long tradition of ancient Greek rationalism rooted in the period of Presocratic philosophy, is also foreshadowing some of the cultural developments that would take place in the following centuries, chiefly over the periods of the Middle Ages and the Renaissance. Based primarily on what are regarded as the fundamental principles of Platonic philosophy, it continues the optimistic and systematic version of philosophy represented by the various schools of the Hellenistic and Greco-Roman periods, though it also exhibits some of the uncertainties and ambivalences informing the unquestionably darker and less self-assured worldview that became prevalent during Plotinus’s own lifetime. In this way, although Plotinus maintains a distinctly traditional outlook, he prefigures the advent of a new era of intellectual accomplishments, and that is why today, although he sometimes appears unduly attached to tradition, his views and sensitivities also strike us as astonishingly innovative or even modern.

1. Life and Writings

Thanks to Porphyry’s editorial solicitude, we possess almost the entirety of Plotinus’ oeuvre, grouped thematically into the Enneads, thus dubbed on account of their peculiar symmetric arrangement into six parts, each of which contains nine treatises.[1] By arranging his teacher’s works into the arithmetical schema of the Enneads, Porphyry attempted to order them in accordance with their content. This represents an approach that engages first with the more “accessible” and “simple”, in terms of their themes, treatments of questions of moral and anthropological nature (in Ennead I), moving on to issues pertaining to the sensible world and the basic principles that govern its functioning (in Enneads II and III), and then proceeding to the more elusive and complex problems concerning the three supra-sensible so-called “hypostases” of his system, namely the soul (in Ennead IV), the Intellect (in Enneads V and VI) and the One (in Ennead VI), where Plotinus introduces and analyzes in detail the higher principles on the basis of which the entire sensible reality is produced and articulated. It is unclear, however, whether this approach is indeed helpful to readers, who are right from the start confronted with some of the most intractable and demanding of Plotinus’ treatises. In general, Porphyry’s arrangement has been repeatedly criticized in the past as utterly artificial and arbitrary, echoing more the editor’s views than those of Plotinus.

On the other hand, thanks to Porphyry again, we possess a complete chronological table recording in detail the order of composition of each of the treatises that were subsequently incorporated into the Enneads (VP 4.22–6.25). Some of the more recent editors have in fact opted to follow this order, having entirely given up on the effort of organizing the relevant material on the basis of its various themes. Despite the advantages of this approach, the fact remains that the chronological arrangement of Plotinus’ works rarely helps readers form a complete and precise picture of his philosophy. For although we can arguably discern some signs of development in his thought regarding specific issues (see, e.g., Meijer 1992: 27–52), it appears fairly cohesive as a whole and stable in its pivotal points. Any changes pertain chiefly to the manner in which he formulates his meanings, or perhaps to his more dedicated focus on certain subjects, without substantial deviations in terms of philosophical content and implications. Thus, for example, in his early works Plotinus tends to rely somewhat more extensively on a doxographical type of analysis of earlier approaches to the question at hand, but this is certainly no reason to regard these works as more introductory or more readily accessible to readers. Furthermore, throughout his authorial cursus he often revisits the same themes over and over again, each time approaching them from a slightly different perspective. In these cases, it is certainly preferable to have before us all the treatises dedicated to connected issues or with complementary content. Furthermore, Plotinus began composing his works approximately in the last sixteen years of his life, which means he started when he was already at the mature age of fifty. In light of this, it appears unlikely that in this period of time his philosophical views changed or evolved significantly, especially since he regarded his philosophy as something complete and given from the outset—with Plato having already furnished its fundamentals, albeit in a manner that required concerted effort so as to properly interpret and present it with the completeness it deserves.

Thanks to the introductory text, the Vita Plotini (VP), with which Porphyry prefaces his edition, we can also avail ourselves of a sufficiently reliable account of Plotinus’ life and milieu. It includes information on the way in which he taught and composed his works, and also on how these were received by his contemporaries. Overall, Porphyry’s first-hand account constitutes an invaluable testimony on the way of life of one of the preeminent thinkers of antiquity, while it also provides precious information about one of the less well-known periods of the Roman era, which is often, and not without good reason, described as the “Third Century Crisis”. Porphyry was a student of Plotinus and lived with him for a period of roughly five years. We learn from his account that his master was a native of Egypt (we may infer that he was born in 204 CE); that he came to attend the lectures of the elusive but evidently influential Ammonius Saccas in Alexandria at the age of 28 and that he stayed with his teacher for the next eleven years, until he decided to follow the infelicitous expedition emperor Gordian III launched against Persia in 243. We are told that he did so because he aspired to become “acquainted with the wisdom of the Persians and the Indians”. After the expedition was aborted when Gordian was murdered by his troops, Plotinus moved to Rome, where he appears to have had some important social connections, and settled permanently there late in 244, teaching continuously for more than twenty-five years, until his death in 270. He offered what appears to be a fairly organized series of lectures that were open to the public and regularly attended by a group of trusted pupils, well-versed in the master’s distinctive approach and manner of exposition.

His written works, which vary in length from a single page to over a hundred, were firmly bound up with the activities of the “school” in which he taught, as they echo the manner of presenting and analyzing the various questions treated in that environment (see VP 4.9–14). Plotinus’ “treatises” began to be composed ten years after his arrival in Rome and they aimed mainly at recording the discussions that took place in the classroom, functioning as “reminders” (hupomnēmata) for those who participated in the “meetings” (sunousiai) (VP 13.15–7). Porphyry describes how these meetings unfolded, and his testimony is rather enlightening on this point, as it also offers us important insights into how Plotinus’ works were composed.

As he recounts, the sunousiai usually commenced by reading out loud substantial passages from available treatises or commentaries on the works of Plato and Aristotle composed by various roughly contemporary scholars; then, the master extensively discussed with those present the “difficulties” (aporiai) of the subject treated in these passages. Finally, Plotinus would outline his own, often rather astute, analysis of the matter at hand and subsequently announced the end of the meeting (VP 14.10–8).

It is easy to identify traces of this method of addressing philosophical questions in Plotinus’ works, and it is evident that these works were primarily addressed to a rather limited circle of students, those described as “auditors” (akroatai) or companions. These were already accustomed to their teacher’s “usual manner of expressing himself” (VP 20.7) but also well-versed in the works contained in the “reading list”, which were discussed during these meetings. It is obvious that Plotinus’s readers were expected to be well acquainted with the works of Plato and Aristotle, so as to be able to readily identify his frequent references, or even mere allusions, to them. We can rather easily recognize these “primary” sources today. It is a much more arduous task to track down and highlight references to the “secondary bibliography”, by which I mean the exegetical works mentioned earlier which were one of Plotinus’ key instruments when teaching. Although these works undoubtedly played a significant role in shaping Plotinus’s thought—and are therefore important for any attempt at understanding it—it is nonetheless almost impossible to accurately gauge their contribution beyond the general remarks provided by Porphyry, as most are nowadays nonextant and thus largely obscure to us. Things are further complicated by Plotinus’s habit of never mentioning by name sources that were chronologically closer to him. In this he differs radically from his pupil, Porphyry, who, after having studied grammar and rhetoric in Athens, was accustomed to meticulously quoting the works he employed in his writings; in fact, this earned him the—rather derogatory—sobriquet “much-learned” (polumathēs). In contrast, Plotinus almost never reveals the sources he is drawing on, although, as Porphyry informs us, “his writings are full of concealed Stoic and Peripatetic doctrines: Aristotle’s Metaphysics, in particular, is concentrated in them” (VP 14.4–6).

This lack of references constitutes one of the main sources of the difficulties modern readers face when engaging with the Enneads. Yet there are further challenges which are due to the peculiar manner in which Plotinus often chooses to express his thoughts. Porphyry’s testimony proves once again instrumental. For he describes in rather vivid detail how his teacher composed his treatises (VP 8.1–19). He thus makes it possible for us to understand the reasons why Plotinus’ authorial style often exhibits an associative structure, with frequent repetitions and labyrinthine interconnections, where we sometimes have the feeling of witnessing the oral expression of an internal monologue or even a live dialogue with an unnamed interlocutor, evidently without any sustained effort having gone into systematically revising or arranging the relevant material.

This, however, in no way implies that Plotinus’s thought is itself unsystematic. The reader readily perceives that the array of philosophical thoughts conveyed in these works aims to provide a fully organized and minutely arranged, comprehensive conception of reality, with each individual treatise attempting to reveal a particular facet of it that is—or seeks to be—harmoniously ordered in a larger overarching synthesis. Plato’s philosophy is central to this systematic project, and it too is treated as a complete philosophical system, but one that can be readily developed, expanded, supplemented, and even corrected and adapted in certain minor respects, to meet the new philosophical challenges of Plotinus’ time. At any rate, Plato’s figure dominates Plotinus’ thought, constituting the key source of inspiration for the worldview of the founder of what in modern times has come to be called “Neoplatonism”.

Concurrently, however, we should not underplay the very substantial contribution of Aristotelian philosophy, which, as also noted by Porphyry, is ever present in Plotinus’ treatises. Plotinus constantly applies himself to providing responses to the objections raised by Aristotle vis-à-vis Plato’s philosophy, and simultaneously makes systematic efforts to incorporate some of Aristotle’s basic conclusions into the broader edifice of Platonism, as Plotinus understood it; Aristotelianism is a fundamental component in how he elaborated and presented his philosophical questions. Sometimes, this makes his exposition appear like a detailed and comprehensive dialogue with Aristotle as well as with some of his chief interpreters. Thus the need to grapple with the developments in the interpretation of Plato and Aristotle—but also to engage with the Stoics and other less well-known philosophical currents, such as Neopythagoreanism and Gnosticism—shapes Plotinus’s thought, even though this is not immediately clear when we first engage with his works (see, e.g., Chiaradonna 2002, Graeser 1972, Gertz 2022). Furthermore, by reading side by side thematically interrelated passages dispersed throughout the Enneads we can reconstruct the path Plotinus followed in developing his philosophy and gain awareness of the manner in which each of his theoretical tenets contributes to the overall system.

However, despite the systematic aspirations of his endeavor as a whole, it remains most challenging for his readers to discern a specific path they are called on to follow in reading his treatises so as to navigate them in a way that is sufficiently consonant with its internal structure. In what follows, I freely treat ideas encountered in different sections of the Enneads as forming parts of a fairly coherent systematic edifice displaying remarkable consistency of thought and of general theoretical outlook.

2. The Nature of Sensible Bodies

The analysis of sensible reality attempted by Plotinus exhibits, at first glance, important analogies as well as substantial differences from the one we find in the works of Aristotle. In a word, Aristotle takes a hylomorphic model as its basis. According to this model, each individual body is comprised of two constituents, a material and a formal one, with both always forming a unity, and without any of the two being capable of existing independently of the other. For Plotinus, however, their individual combinations are subject to endless alternation, resulting in the continuous fluidity of the phenomena observed in the sensible realm (III 6.6.76–77). In his view, the material constituent of bodies is “matter” (hulē) conceived of as the permanent substrate of all the changes occurring on the level of sensible reality. Plotinus’s matter differs from Aristotle’s because, in contrast to it, it is not that earlier stage of reality from which (ex hou) a body comes to be in virtue of a form through the occurrence of certain changes. For Plotinus it never actually receives a form but, on the contrary, it constitutes a stable and utterly inert substrate in which (en hōi) sensible forms become manifest (ΙΙΙ 6.17.27). In other words, sensible forms, for Plotinus, determine the identity and characteristics of each material thing, without the substrate itself incurring any real shaping or change. In itself, matter completely lacks qualitative or quantitative characteristics, such as size and extension (ΙΙ 4.14.20–30; see Hutchinson 2022: 305–7). It is simply predisposed to afford extension to whatever it takes on (ΙΙ 4.11.17–19), thus enabling those formal components, whose coexistence elicits the impression of a particular body extended in space, to appear on it. Since matter is never endowed with any qualities or quantities, as it is the substrate that merely renders their appearance possible, it is characterized by Plotinus as “non-being” (ΙΙΙ 6.6.29–32, 7.1–12), in the sense that it possesses none of the qualitative and quantitative characteristics that would impart on it a particular identity (ΙΙ 5.5.6–13). This complete absence of qualities makes it receptive to any form that is projected on it, since matter, by remaining totally unaffected, does not put up any resistance and thus functions like an utterly impassible mirror, on which a variety of forms appear without ever truly shaping it; matter is incapable of acquiring any of these and making it truly its own (ΙΙΙ 6.18.29–41).

On the other hand, the formal component of sensible bodies, which imparts on them a specific identity making each what it is, is not, as Aristotle would put it, a simple eidetic shape, a form (eidos), but what Plotinus calls a “formative principle” (logos) (ΙΙ 6.2.15–19, ΙΙ 7.3.6–14). This logos is each time a combination of formal characteristics, whose coexistence bestows on each individual body its identity and, in that sense, could be described—in Aristotelian terms—as its “essence”, that is, as what something is primarily, which also corresponds to its definition. Thus, for example, a particular instance of fire will possess, among others, the qualitative characteristics of being hot, dry and moving upwards, which differentiate it from other elements. In other words, it is the formative principle that determines each body for what it is, and that differentiates it from, and associates it with, other bodies within the sensible world (VI 3.15.27–38; see Kalligas 2011: 771–77 and cf. Chiaradonna 2016: 43–6).

At the same time, each individual body, whose identity has been determined in this manner by the corresponding formative principle, is capable of taking on additional qualitative, quantitative or other characteristics; these will determine it further without, however, altering its fundamental character as the thing it is (VI 3.8.23–30, 10.7–20), i.e., without depriving it of its identity or, in other words, its quasi-essence. Hence, the fundamental distinction introduced by Aristotle between the primary or “first” substance and the other categories that exist in it as “inherent” qualities, predicated of it as “in a subject”, is retained by Plotinus. Plotinus, however, does not assign to this “substance” the key role it performs in the Stagirite’s philosophy, insofar as a substance, for him, is a, more or less, contingent synthesis of qualitative (and possibly quantitative) characteristics (which correspond to the specific formative logos) and matter (VI 3.8.16–27, 9.27–36; cf. D’Ancona 1997: 377–82).

But there is another point on which Plotinus differs from Aristotle in his analysis of bodies. For Plotinus the qualitative (and possibly other) characteristics, which convey on any given body the properties that we, through our senses, recognize and perceive as inherent to it, do not constitute real entities possessing a self-subsistent identity, but are mere images or likenesses of the true intelligible beings (ΙΙΙ 6.7.23–42). The latter are intelligible, and consequently supra-sensible Forms, and participation in these causes the occurrence of the corresponding “phenomenalities” on matter and thus the formation of the sensible images that we perceive as present in it (ΙΙΙ 6.11.1–8; see D’Ancona 1997: 393–7). The formative principle acts as an intermediary: it projects (temporarily and incidentally) on the level of phenomenality (i.e., the sensible world) a reality that is established on the level of intelligible beings or of intelligible Essence, and it thereby organizes what appears within it on the basis of principles and specifications that are determined by that Essence.

For this formative process to take place, there needs to be the mediation of an additional active causal factor, which will project these sensible reflections from the realm of intelligible entities onto that of sensible things. This is none other than the soul, which is an utterly independent and self-subsistent entity that, by its very constitution, is capable of accessing both realms. The soul is in charge of enabling the formative principles to project forms onto the sensible world. The activity by which the soul carries out its task of transmitting the reflections of the intelligible Forms to the sensible world is called “contemplation” (theōria). As will become clear in section 6, this mode of transmission is part of a broader tendency inherent in Plotinus’ ontological system, where the “higher” entities become manifest in the “lower” levels in the guise of “images” or “traces”. Through theōria, the soul is directed to the intelligible Forms and apprehends their representations. Having developed and processed the content of these representations in accordance with its own cognitive abilities, the soul, so to say, transmits the information coming from the intelligible realm to the sensible world by shaping the latter in the image of the former in a manner that corresponds to its own peculiar mode of contemplation (ΙΙΙ 8.4.1–22). Hence, we could claim that the formative role played in Aristotle’s philosophy by “enmattered form” (enhulon eidos) in the formation of bodies is fulfilled, according to Plotinus, by the (“secondary”, as will be described further on) activity of the soul. This is because the soul itself, having contemplated the eidetic models of sensible things, i.e., the forms, can accordingly produce the characteristics of the logoi in their role as formative principles of sensible things (ΙΙΙ 2.2.16–42, ΙΙΙ 8.4.15–31).

Insofar as a body is animated by an individual soul, its soul will be in charge of shaping and arranging it. In the case of bodies that lack an individual soul, they will be shaped by what Plotinus calls “Nature”, a causal principle originating from the cosmic Soul, which, through its Providence, rules over the entirety of the sensible universe and it organizes it into a coherent and harmonious whole. This whole is governed by forces and interactions securing its proper functioning as a complete, self-sustained and self-powered organism, albeit one that is unconscious of its actions, as it merely conforms, involuntarily and almost automatically, to the instructions resulting from the contemplation in which the cosmic Soul is engaged (ΙΙΙ 8.5.1–29).

We should note here that the apparent shaping of matter through the action of the qualitative characteristics that are projected on it either by a specific formative principle or, alternatively, by the activity of individual souls is carried out gradually over successive phases. These phases render the substrate receptive to a further stratum of characteristics that specify the properties that will appear on a particular body. Thus, for example, the originally shapeless “earth” formed by the fundamental properties of the “cold” and the “dry”, may become a definite quantity of a certain material, such as, e.g., psimuthion (“white lead”, a powder employed as a cosmetic throughout antiquity), which possesses the further characteristic properties of whiteness and toxicity (ΙΙ 6.1.16–31). This layered formative process enables the gradual emergence of very complex kinds of corporeality, and it gives rise to the almost inexhaustible variety of perceptible shapes observed in the universe, even prior to the appearance of any kind of living organism in it (V 8.7.16–24).

A characteristic feature of bodies is their extension and divisibility. And insofar as the division of any body leads to the formation of two or more smaller bodies, for Plotinus the process of subdivision can continue in perpetuity, without some definitively indivisible bodily component ever emerging (IV 2.1.11–17). Moreover, Plotinus argues that any body can be arrayed next to other bodies or intermingled with them in various ways while retaining its basic properties, at least in potentiality, and it may instantaneously recover these once it becomes separated from them (ΙΙ 7.2.22–42). These properties continue to characterize it and are not diffused in its environment except by undergoing specific predetermined processes that are governed by the natural laws, that is, by the “instructions” with which the cosmic Soul regulates interactions between the different bodies through relations of “affinity” and “disaffinity” that link bodies to one another (IV 4.32.7–25).

The sum total of these laws, which remain constant and immutable as a consequence of the stability of the cosmic Soul’s contemplation of intelligible Forms, is sometimes described as Nature or even as Destiny (heimarmenē) (III 1.10.1–10). It extends along the full expanse of the universe and ensures its eternal duration (ΙΙ 1.3.1–23). Destiny is a network of deterministic rules that operate almost automatically and unintentionally, responding to a kind of “hypothetical necessity”, where the same causes inexorably produce the same effects, provided that no other exogenous factor enters into play. The network of all these laws orderly regulates all changes occurring within the sensible universe, and it predetermines the behavior of bodies in it in a manner that is consistent and predictable, so long as no additional causal factors intrude (II 3.13.3–45).

But apart from the inanimate bodies, the sensible realm also includes a great number of living organisms that are distributed in it in accordance with the material constitution of the bodies they possess (ΙΙΙ 2.3.23–30). The life of these organisms is governed and regulated not only by the fundamental inexorable laws of universal Nature but also by the individual souls, which coexist and cooperate with the cosmic Soul and jointly shape the universe (VI 7.7.8–16; see Tornau 2016: 140–52). These souls are kindred and homologous to the cosmic Soul, which governs the universe as a whole (IV 3.2.54–58, 6.1–15), but they focus their activity on animating and managing individual bodies. The kinship linking them to one another enables souls to communicate and interact, even without the intervention of their corresponding bodies (IV 9.3.1–9), and at the same time it makes them coordinate and harmonize their activity so as to bring about a unitary, although not free of contrarieties and antagonism, harmonious whole (IV 8.5.1–8).

As will be shown below in section 4, these individual souls do not actually descend nor do they inhabit the bodies that they animate, but merely project upon them an image of themselves, which imparts on bodies a semblance of vital functions and leads to the formation of what is called the “living organism” or simply “living being” (zōion) (see I 1.7.1–6, III 4.3.24–27, III 9.3.1–4, IV 3.26.1–9, IV 4.18.7, IV 8.8.1–3, VI 4.16.14–17, VI 7.5.21–30, and Igal 1979: 330–40; Caluori 2022: 233–5). The life enjoyed by this organism and all its constituting parts is not real, but a mere effulgence of real life, which is the soul’s primary activity. The souls remain “undescended” and untouched by corporeality, supervising the various functions and affections of the organic body, so to speak, “from above” (IV 3.12.1–8, IV 8.5.24–6.10, VI 4.6.9–19), without ever becoming directly involved into what the body incurs as a consequence of its interaction with other bodies in the world. It is only a soul’s engagement with, and solicitude for, the particular body that can, if it grows excessive, cause it to become emotionally entangled with the body and end up participating in what befalls it, in the form of pleasure or distress and pain, as well as of the other affections associated with corporeal life (II 9.2.4–10, III 2.7.15–28, IV 3.6.25–27, V 1.1.9–19.). On the contrary, the “living being” is the true subject of the so-called psychic affections, which the soul apprehends cognitively, without itself suffering anything (Ι 1.2.9–11, ΙΙΙ 6.1.28–30).

The individual soul’s activity animates the organism as a whole in such a manner as to ensure interaction between its parts. Anything that happens to one part impacts all the other parts, and as a result the whole behaves and reacts as an organized unity that, in this way, appears to be pervaded by an internal “sympathy” and possessed of a kind of precursory “intuition” (III 6.4.18–23, IV 4.35.1–21; see Tornau 2016: 140–52). Correspondingly, on the cosmic level, the natural laws ensure the interaction between the parts of the universe even when these are not in direct physical contact with one another, thereby producing the network of sympathetic “magical” interactions that permeate Nature through and through (IV 4.32.10–25, 37.11–25, 40.1–14). These interactions, as we have pointed out, manifest themselves automatically and involuntarily, not requiring any conscious intervention or effort on the part of the cosmic Soul (III 4.4.2–13, IV 8.2.6–24). The nature of the activities that determine these bonds can be described, on account of the mutual attraction they exercise, as “erotic”, in the sense that they echo the presence of cosmic Love as the cohesive power of the universe (IV 4.40.1–12; cf. Hadot 1982: 286–9). In this way, the entirety of the sensible world is constituted into a unitary universe, which is held together by internal necessity and harmony, while it moves in a circle governed by the Soul that rules over it, which in turn ceaselessly imitates the self-thinking motion of the divine Intellect (II 2.1.1–19, 2.5–15, III 2.3.29–31, VI 4.2.34–49, VI 9.8.1–8; cf. Wilberding 2006: 63–8). Interactions between the parts of the sensible world are governed by stable laws; in turn, these echo the mathematical constitution of the cosmic Soul, resulting in a beautiful and harmoniously arranged whole, which corresponds, so far as this is possible, to the sublime beauty of the model on the basis of which it has been constituted (V 8.3.1–10, 8.1–7; see Armstrong 1975: 156–60). Thus it is made clear that the organization and arrangement of the universe are expressions of cosmic Providence, through which the higher principles manifest themselves in the realm of sensible realities and determine the unfolding of phenomena on the basis of an overall regulatory framework—the rational order of the cosmos (ΙΙ 3.13.34–38, ΙΙΙ 2.11.6–16). The movements of the heavenly bodies as well as the interplay between them and their interactions with earthly phenomena also submit to this rational order; at any rate, they cannot transcend the level of unintentional and unconscious Destiny (heimarmenē) (II 3.14.2–21).

3. First Digression: The presence of the supra-sensible hypostases in the sensible domain

Plotinus takes for granted the fundamental Platonic distinction between two levels of reality, an intelligible and a perceptible one (see III 7.1.1–3, VI 2.1.16–33, VI 4.2.1–3). Investigating the relation binding together these two levels is instrumental to understanding the explanatory role supra-sensible entities are called on to play with respect to what appears in the sensible realm.

The “participation” (methexis) of sensible things in the intelligible realities (these also include the souls) does not occur through the “extension” of the latter into the space occupied by the former (VI 4.2.17–34). For, qua incorporeal entities, intelligible beings can in no wise become extended in space, whose existence, in any case, depends on the presence of perceptible bodies (II 4.12.11–12). The omnipresence of intelligible entities consists in the fact that, jointly, they constitute a unitary, self-sufficient totality, with parts that are fully and mutually interrelated (VI 4.11.3–14). It is the sensible things that through their gradual shaping become, where applicable, susceptible to receiving the activity of the intelligible beings, thereby conforming with, and approximating, these, to the extent possible (VI 4.12.7–12, 33–41; see O’Meara 1980: 67–70), echoing some of their characteristics in the guise of the “images” or “traces” that are formed upon them, and which impart to them the various characteristics that distinguish them from one another. The causal relations that determine them always flow from the higher toward the lower, but “participation in”, and conformation with, the higher realities occur each time according to the ability of the lower to become a recipient of something that, while already present in it, does not manifest itself until the requisite response or adequacy obtains (VI 5.8.15–22). So the emergence of vital functions in a living body is posterior to its organic constitution by the cosmic Soul. This constitution renders it capable of receiving the psychic powers that will become manifest in the corresponding life-related activities (VI 4.15.8–18). The gradual and increasingly more complex presence of such functions allows the manifestation of progressively higher, and fuller “echoes” from the intelligible realm, culminating with the appearance of rational abilities in the human organism, and the activation of the corresponding ratiocinative function. In this manner, as a microcosm, the structure of the human being reflects the overall constitution of the sensible macrocosm (ΙΙ 3.5.33–42, ΙΙΙ 4.2.6–11, 3.16–24, 6.18–28).

4. The Hypostasis of the Soul

What mainly distinguishes the various ontological levels posited in Plotinus’ philosophy is the different degree of unity that corresponds to each. Thus, while bodies are by their nature divisible, which means they become apportioned and parceled into ever smaller parts, the soul, which, according to the psychogony found in Plato’s Timaeus, is made of a divisible and an indivisible component (IV 1.10–22, IV 2.2.49–53), insofar as it is an incorporeal and supra-sensible entity (IV 7.2.4–25, 8.43–9.16), has the characteristic of not becoming apportioned in the body that it animates. In contrast to, e.g., perceptible qualities, whose division is a concomitant of the dispersion of the bodies in which they inhere (IV 2.1.29–41, VI 4.4.32–33), the soul is always present in its totality in every single part of the body it animates (see Emilsson 1991: 152–61). This allows it to manifest a unitary life as its primary activity (IV 2.1.62–76); though this life is expressed differently in each individual bodily organ, it retains its fundamental unity, which enables it to coordinate all the specific faculties of the living body into a unitary “mode of life” (bios). This means that all individual organs combine and coordinate their functions so that they carry out jointly a unitary work (VI 4.1.24–32), one that corresponds to the nature of the overall living organism that is made up of these organs and is reflected in the corresponding formative principle (IV 3.8.38–55).

The soul’s peculiar mode of life is also intertwined with time; the latter corresponds to, and is essentially produced by, the succession of individual psychic acts. The soul is by its nature forced to retrace the atemporal structure of the intelligible entities on which it is focused in its “contemplation”, and to deal with these one by one, since it is usually unable to comprehend them all together in their totality (V 1.4.17–20). This amounts to a distinctively discursive and distributive approach to intelligible reality, even on the level of rational apprehension and elaboration of the relevant concepts, and it is a characteristic feature of psychic life (V 1.4.18–20) as it apportions its activity in the context of temporality, resulting in the birth of time itself, but also in the emergence of movement in the sensible realm (III 7.11.20–45; see Strange 1994: 47–51).

Jointly, the souls comprise a unitary hypostasis, that is, they represent a uniform mode of being, which is often described as “one and many” (hen kai polla) (IV 2.2.39–42, IV 3.8.10–35, V 1.8.26). This means that, while they are many and different from each other, the souls are nonetheless interconnected through relations of mutual kinship (sungeneia), which allow them to participate in common experiences (IV 9.3.1–9) without this compromising the individuality of each. The question of how souls are individuated, if we discount their involvement in any manner of relation with the bodies they animate, preoccupied Plotinus in various phases of his career. The solution he ultimately suggests consists in making the soul’s individuality depend upon the peculiar perspective each soul possesses with respect to the way in which it contemplates the intelligible beings (IV 3.5.1–15, V 8.10.10–22; see Kalligas 1997: 222–6).

Various kinds of consciousness emerge in the context of the life of the soul, depending on the functional level that is activated in each case. This is because, although the soul, as a hypostasis, is extended from the realm of intelligible beings all the way to the fringes of corporeality, the epicenter of its consciousness—that is, the “I” which is usually denoted through the pronoun “we” (hēmeis) (I 1.7.6–9, 10.1–11)—is commonly located in the area of the “representational faculty” which is dubbed phantasia, and the focus of this can shift either in the direction of the higher entities of the intelligible realm (VI 5.7.1–8: cf. Schroeder 1987: 682–93; Remes 2007: 111–24; 170–5; and Tornau 2009: 351–5), or toward corporeal experiences (I 1.11.5–8, IV 3.30.15–16, V 1.12.15, V 3.3.36–40). This involves a reorientation of its attention (III 6.5.19–22, IV 8.3.21–30, 8.16–23), and it enables the soul to understand itself and the world through different perspectives (IV 6.3.7–8, IV 8.7.1–17; cf. Rist 1983: 142–8), which is why Plotinus can describe the soul as “amphibious” (amphibios) (IV 8.4.31–35). This shift of perspective has an impact both on the soul’s epistemic apprehension of reality and on its moral attitude. As already mentioned, the soul’s connection to the body it animates is not real, in the sense that the soul itself, qua supra-sensible and utterly incorporeal entity, does not “descend” nor enters its body, but merely imposes on it the vital functions that the body is capable of assuming. Therefore the soul does not directly partake of the affections and all the other things the body incurs from the other sensible bodies (IV 4.19.26–27, 12.30–32, IV 6.2.16–18, VI 1.19.46–48), but simply possesses the ability to become aware of these affections (ΙΙΙ 6.1.1–8, IV 3.26.1–9) and to attune its reactions to them—if any—depending on its predispositions to these (see Hutchinson 2018: 75–99). Unconscious apprehensions, whether they originate from the intelligible or the sensible realm, also play an important role in psychic life; for these may influence the soul and determine its activity without ever becoming fully perceived (I 4.10.6–21, IV 3.28, IV 4.8.8–34, 20.18–36, 21.10–12, IV 8.8.3–13, V 1.12.5–15; cf. Hadot 1980: 249–56; Chiaradonna 2012: sect. 3 and 4).

The various ways in which the soul can activate its powers also determine the animation of different kinds of organisms. Each type of organism, in fact, comes to be as a consequence of the activation of a specific type of psychic function. These functions correspond to the relevant psychic powers that are being activated through the corresponding formative principles (V 7.2.5–21). The so-called reincarnation of the souls is nothing more than the consequence of the manner in which each soul activates its powers, where the ones that remain inert may resurface in another phase of its career through time (I 1.11.9–15, III 3.4.33–43, III 4.2.16–30, IV 3.24.6–21, IV 9.2.13–22, VI 4.16.13–21, VI 7.6.21–7.8; cf. Hutchinson 2018: 63–6). Even the “guardian spirit” (eilēchōs daimōn) that, according to traditional beliefs current at the time, watches over the soul and stands by it, overseeing its critical decisions, is but a mere representative of the higher psychic powers, which belong to the level immediately above the one that is activated in any given soul (III 4.3.3–8; cf. Coope 2020: 170–71).

Each soul, depending on the abilities it possesses, can fulfill a specific role in the universe, contributing in its own way to the providential arrangement of all things (III 2.17.32–85). When the soul comprehends this overall design and harmoniously adjusts its activity within it, then it participates, in the fullest way possible, to the overall good ordering, avoiding at the same time the self-seeking pursuits that cause it to divert from the purpose of its presence in the world (IV 8.4.12–30), namely to render it more well-regulated and beautiful, a worthy image of its intelligible model.

In general, there is a tendency in Plotinus’ philosophy to display the natural world as a sphere for the soul’s activity; the world is an as-good-as-it-can-possibly-become imitation of the model of the “perfect organism”—a view familiar to us from the cosmogony of the Timaeus (30d1–b3)—, which is distinguished by superb intelligible beauty (III 2.2.1–3.13). This view brought Plotinus into direct confrontation with the views of his contemporary Gnostics, who held that the sensible world is the work of a foolish or even malevolent creator (II 9.4.2–26), a place where the souls, created by another, supreme and benevolent but also “unknown” God, are exiled. According to the Gnostics, human souls are at odds and constantly in conflict with the cosmic forces, seeking to get rid of the fetters imposed on them when they became tied to their bodies (II 9.5.8–16). Plotinus vigorously resisted this extremely dualistic and radically anti-cosmic vision of the world, consistently upholding the goodness and beauty of perceptible reality: its imperfections must, in his view, be ascribed to the ramifications of its inescapable materiality, from which, in fact, all forms of badness stem. More specifically, matter is the primary cause for the existence of evil in the world, precisely because its nature consists in a complete privation of any eidetic characteristic (I 8.11.1–4; see Emilsson 2019: 84–88), a privation which makes it radically devoid of any trace of goodness. Nonetheless, in and of itself, qua nonbeing (I 8.3.3–7, 5.9–13), matter lacks the potency to act as an autonomous causal factor, merely constituting the necessary objective precondition for the appearance of evil, chiefly in the form of wickedness in the soul (I 8.4.5–25, 14.1–50, 15.13–21). Wickedness occurs when the soul is diverted from its innate pursuit of goodness because it becomes disoriented by the reflections of the Good appearing on matter (Ι 1.9.4–8). These cause it to be carried away to aspiring after things that possess but a mere semblance of beauty and goodness. By becoming aware of the real nature of things, but also of its own true nature through philosophy, the soul is released from the illusions engendered in it by matter (ΙΙΙ 6.2.22–41). Liberated from its engagement with corporeality and the associated affections, it can ultimately turn to the pursuit of the true Good in the supra-sensible realm (V 1.1.8–29). Its consequent aiming at contemplation has an impact even on the way it acts on the practical level. Indeed, practical action itself is caused by the soul’s innate desire for contemplation, and it takes place when the soul is distracted or misguided due to its feebleness and its inability to focus completely on the proper objects of its contemplative activity, namely the intelligible realities (III 8.1.15–18, 4.31–47, 6.1–14; cf. Wilberding 2008: 375–83; Coope 2020: 188–90).

Naturally, humans occupy a central place among living beings, and all psychic functions become fully manifest in them. In the case of a human being, the soul, as a self-contained principle (ΙΙΙ 1.8.4–10), is capable to activate by its own volition all of its powers, ranging from the lower ones, which correspond to the “vegetative” functions of nutrition, growth, and reproduction, and the purely “vital” ones of sensation motility and representational “imagination” (phantasia) (ΙΙΙ 6.4.18–23, IV 3.30.1–13), to the higher ones, which pertain to humans only (but maybe also to the superhuman demonic and divine entities), those of discursive reasoning and intellection (VI 7.5.11–30). The “real man” is certainly something different from the compound “living being”, which, as we have seen, is formed when the image of an individual soul is projected on an organic body thereby animating it (VI 7.4.2–33). The “living being” is produced by the eidetic cause, that is, the psychic constituent to which the living organism owes its life, and which otherwise transcends it (VI 7.5.2–8). This psychic constituent brings us into contact with the even higher realm of the intelligible beings, affording us the ability to transcend the normal human condition so as to become something truly divine (IV 8.1.1–11).

To become truly divine, we need to develop not only epistemically but also ethically. In this context we can appreciate how important ethical living is if people are to find their proper orientation in the world. Plotinus classifies the basic virtues along a hierarchical ladder, with the so-called “political” virtues, which pertain to the regulation and management of the soul’s lower impulses, those connected with the body, occupying the lowest step. “Cathartic” virtues are placed one step higher: through these, the soul becomes entirely free of its solicitude for the body (I 6.5.54–58, IV 7.10.40–52); on the third step we find the “theoretical” virtues, which are connected with the soul’s dedication to the intelligible truths. Finally, the highest virtues, the “paradigmatic” ones, are the intelligible models, on the basis of which a human being’s overall ethical life is regulated—in other words, the intelligible Forms of virtues such as Justice, Temperance and the rest (I 2.2.13–6.19; see Tuominen 2022: 367–70). By conforming to these models through intellective contemplation, a human being comes to resemble God (I 2.6.2–27), thereby becoming truly self-willed and self-ruled (VI 8.5.20–37). In so doing, one gains his or her “well-being” (eudaimonia), the supreme and unshakable psychic state in which, through the full activation of intellective life (Ι 4.3.18–4.2), one comes to possess the intelligible truths as a part of oneself (VI 8.5.30–37). This is the ultimate aspiration of all human rational efforts, and it results in a kind of serene, eminently blissful state (Ι 6.4.12–22).

5. Second Digression: The fundamental principles of Plotinus’ Metaphysics

At this point, and before moving on to the presentation of the higher levels of Plotinus’ philosophical system, we should summarily set out some of the fundamental principles that govern the articulation of his overall theoretical edifice, and are thereby imparting to it a notable unity and logical coherence. Although not all such principles are clearly expounded in his work, nonetheless they can be gleaned from specific passages, references to which will be provided in what follows. I will attempt to demonstrate that they rest on a common logical underpinning, which connects them to one another but also to a number of complementary positions. These positions are supported in various places of the Enneads, and they reveal the importance of these principles and their implications. They are subdivided into fundamental (FP) and supplementary principles (SP): the former certainly hold greater significance in terms of their theoretical implications, yet the latter group also occupies an important place in the structure of the overall system.

FP1: First we need to mention the “Principle of the (logical) Priority of the Simple vis-à-vis the Multiple”. According to this principle, what is ontologically (and explanatorily) prior is always simpler than what originates from, or depends causally on, it (V 3.12.9–10, 16.5–16, V 4.1.5–15, V 6.3.21–22, V 9.8.12–14). This principle entails that any multiplicity presupposes and involves elements, each of which may be considered something simple (V 6.3.1–25). In other words, if anything multiple is to be obtained, it is necessary that it be made up of constituent parts, each of which is one and distinct from the rest. This means that every multiplicity presupposes the existence of things that are, individually, simple and unitary; the collection of all these produces multiplicity. Furthermore, the congregation of a multiplicity of things also presupposes the existence of a single criterion of choice, on the basis of which these things can be set apart from each other and from everything else, and this must be something that is unitary and applicable to all of them. For, each thing, whether sensible or intelligible, presupposes some kind of unity that constitutes it into what it is, even if the degrees of unity fulfilling this constitutive role may vary between them, provided this does not cancel its fundamentally unifying function (VI 6.1.4–7, VI 9.1.1–17). Thus, for all these reasons, unity should be regarded as logically, and thereby ontologically, prior to multiplicity. This fact is emblematically reflected in the system of the so-called three “hypostases” as distinct modes of being, which comprise the main axis around which Plotinus ontology is articulated as a hierarchical structure (see O’Meara 1996: 71–79). Because each of these hypostases depends on the prior one, and represents a further gradient along a scale of ever declining unity: starting from the absolutely simple (and thus ineffable) One (V 3.16.10–16, VI 9.3.1–6), we move to the Intellect, where the interconnected unity of the beings that comprise it entails the inherence of the whole in each of its parts (V 8.4.6–8, VI 2.20.16–23). Subsequently we encounter the level of the soul, where its various parts are connected to each other through indissoluble relations of “affinity” (sumpatheia) and interdependence (IV 4.40.1–6). Finally, matter, being the ultimate and most distant product of psychic activity, is characterized by the extreme multifariousness of the utterly shapeless “unlimitedness” (apeiria) (II 4.15.16–37).

FP2: The second principle can be dubbed the “Principle of the Procreative Power of the Perfect”. According to it, whatever is perfect manifests its perfection by way of an activity, through which it becomes complete as what it is. The line of thought behind this principle appears to be the view that each thing has a fundamental activity, and this activity is a manifestation of what that thing truly is (V 4.2.27–9). This means each thing is distinguished by an activity it exercises which is the very expression of its perfection and around which it articulates its identity: vision, for example, is the activity to which the eye owes its being what it is and its identity is determined by it. Consequently, this activity may be regarded as the direct manifestation of a thing’s “essence”, but also as “internal” and self-constituting, insofar as without it the thing would not be what it is.

FP3: But, according to Plotinus, this primary internal activity is always accompanied by another, secondary and “external” activity, which depends on it but is directed toward the outside of the thing that caused it, thereby impacting other things (V 1.6.38–39). Thus we have what is usually described as “the Theory of the Two Activities”, which constitutes the cornerstone of the so-called process of “emanation”, that is, the process by which the principles of reality other than the first one come to be constituted (II 9.8.21–26, IV 5.7.13–23). A characteristic feature of the secondary activity is that it is derived from the primary one, and hence cannot exist without it (V 1.6.38). Nonetheless, it is something distinct from, and therefore different from, it (IV 5.7.1–13, V 4.2.30), as its presence or lack thereof in no way affects the primary activity, which continues to be what it is, irrespective of whether it brings about any consequences for other things. In this manner a conception of difference is introduced that is “hierarchical” or “vertical”, given that it characterizes the effect’s relation of dependence on the already complete and perfect cause, but not vice versa. The secondary activity is like an image that is distinct and therefore “different” from its model, yet dependent on it (V 1.7.1–5, V 8.12.20), whereas the model is not determined as what it is on account of its otherness in respect to the image. The idea of a secondary activity probably originated, at least partially, from Aristotle’s theory of procreation, and more specifically from the thesis that a perfectly developed organism has the ability to produce offspring, with its progeny being in turn able to grow so as to approximate the original perfection of their progenitor (for an alternative option, see Lloyd 1990: 98–100). Plotinus, though, habitually illustrates the relevant theory employing the example of fire and the heat that it emits (I 2.1.31–36, IV 3.10.30–34, V 1.3.10–12, V 3.7.21–25): while heat, qua primary “internal” activity, inheres in fire as its essential feature (insofar as nothing can be fire unless it is hot), there is also another kind of heat, different from the former, which, qua secondary activity, is emitted by, or “flows out” of, fire, heating the things that surround it, and imparting on these, incidentally this time, the property of becoming hot (V 4.2.27–33). This second form of activity is evidently dependent on the former, and it disappears as soon as that one ceases to be. See further Emilsson 2017: 48–57; Kalligas 2012: 51–61.

FP4: The fact that perfect activation brings about the exhaustive manifestation of all existing possibilities brings us to another fundamental principle, which became known in the history of ideas as the “Principle of Plenitude”. According to this, any possibility, so long as it is real, cannot remain perennially unfulfilled. For, if it were never fulfilled, this would mean that it was not a real possibility from the outset (II 9.13.3–6, IV 8.6.1–18). This, of course, pertains chiefly to sensible things that are subject to becoming, but it also applies a fortiori to intelligible beings (II 5.1.7–10, VI 2.21.49–53). This is because a possibility that cannot be fulfilled, even if only in theory, certainly does not constitute a real possibility. In this manner causal relations are established that connect, among others, all the three fundamental “hypostases” mentioned previously, which thus represent a series of successive causes; these are all reducible to and draw their procreative power from the inexhaustible dynamism of the supreme First Principle (III 2.2.10–12, III 8.10.1–5, V 1.7.9–22, V 3.15.17–33, VI 5.12.1–7, VI 9.6.6–12). Of course, these relations are invariably unidirectional, as suggested by SP2, which is laid out in what follows.

SP1: A basic supplementary principle is that of the “Undiminishing Procreative Power”, according to which the secondary activity produced on the basis of FP3 will not cause the primary activity nor the substance to which it belongs to become diminished in any way (see SP2). This principle is often expressed with the term menein or monē (“abiding”), which denotes that in these cases the procreative cause will remain utterly immutable and unaffected by what follows (V 2.2.1–3, V 4.2.19–26).

SP2: Another supplementary principle, one also directly correlated with FP3, can be dubbed “the Principle of the Predominance of the (metaphysical) Cause”. According to it, anything that is produced in line with FP3 will necessarily be less “perfect” than what produces it, insofar as it is dependent on it (V 1.6.37–39, V 4.1.40–2.3, V 5.13.37–38). As a result, we have a gradual “degradation” of entities from the more to the less perfect (I 8.7.18–19). This process occurs continuously, without any intervening “leaps” from the superior to the inferior levels (V 1.6.48–49); in this way, all of these ontological levels are connected to one another in an uninterrupted succession of causes and effects.

SP3: Finally, a further supplementary principle determines the formation of each lower hypostasis in two distinct phases (III 4.1). In the first phase, that of “advance” (proodos), the secondary activity that is produced remains shapeless and indeterminate, constituting a simple otherness, in the “vertical” sense of the term, with respect to its source of origin. In the second phase, that of “return” (epistrophē), this activity reverts to its source and is thereby articulated, shaped, and perfected, acquiring specific content (cf. FP2). The resulting perfection leads to the formation of a new hypostasis, which in turn acquires procreative power by virtue of FP3 (V 1.6.50).

6. The Hypostasis of the Intellect

Broadly speaking, according to Plotinus the hypostasis of Intellect occupies the domain where the intelligible Forms are established, in other words the entirety of intelligible Essence (ΙΙ 6.1.1–8). These Forms, however, although autonomous and absolutely determined in terms of their content, are not inert abstract entities (V 5.1.41–50), but active intellects in a state of full activation (cf. FP2). This activation allows them to be interconnected forming an organically structured system of interrelated and mutually interdependent truths (III 2.1.26–34, V 5.1.41–58, 2.1–13, V 8.3.30–4.27). Dialectic is the science that examines the structure of this system so as to afford a complete understanding of the whole intelligible realm (Ι 3.4.1–17). Analysis of each of the beings that are included there reveals a network of interconnections (Ι 3.5.9–21), and Plotinus claims that the unity holding them together is such that each of them contains, potentially (dunamei), all the rest, and at the same time it is present, in some manner, in all the others, jointly comprising with them a multiple unity, or “one-many” (hen polla) (V 5.3.1–4, VI 5.9.31–40, VI 7.14.11–18). To elucidate this peculiar mereology of the contents of the Intellect, Plotinus resorts to the example of a theoretical, purely deductive science such as geometry (V 9.6.1–10, VI 2.20.1–24, VI 9.5.18–20; cf. Tornau 1998: 98–109). In geometry, every theorem, although in actuality fully individualized and identifiable, “contains” potentially in some manner all other theorems by virtue of relations of indissoluble logical coherence (V 9.6.1–10, 8.1–7, VI 2.20.10–23), that is, through the proof that establishes its truth and the links that correlate it with all the other theorems of that science, insofar as these are presupposed by it or are derived from its principles. In an analogous way, every intelligible Form has within itself, potentially, all other Forms (VΙ 2.20.16–21.10).

Each of the Forms comprising the intelligible realm is a being, insofar as it is a stable and immutable entity; a living being, qua part of an organic and active whole; and a wakeful intellect, which through its unitary and atemporal activation grasps at once the totality of all other intellects with which it is correlated thereby achieving complete self-intellection. Therefore it constitutes a characteristic feature of Plotinian ontology (probably arising from the influence of the corresponding Aristotelian theory; see Menn 2001: 233–6) that Intellect encompasses the intelligible beings that are the objects of its intellection, and that it does not come after, nor does it precede these, but is fully identified with them (V 1.4.26–33, V 3.5.26–28, V 5.2.13–20, V 9.5.7, 26–32). And that is why the Intellect does not intellectually cognize by seeking after some object or other, but by already possessing the objects of its intellection (V 1.4.16, V 3.9.27–28, V 9.5.12–16; see O’Meara 2000: 243–7). This means that the activation of its intellection constitutes for the Intellect perfect self-intellection (V 3.5.28–48, 7.18–22, V 9.5.1–11), such that there is no room for any possibility of misunderstanding or error. The directness of—every—intellect’s relation to its intellection ensures the truth of all of its thoughts, which, as was stated earlier, constitute a network of interconnected theorems. On the other hand, the very directness of the intellect’s interconnection with the totality of the intelligible objects, to which its activity is directed, precludes the mediation of discursive thought. As we have seen, this thought consists in a succession of distinct acts, and it is a characteristic not of Intellect but of the soul (ΙΙΙ 8.6.21–26). The implication of this is that the intellective apprehension of the intelligible truths is accomplished “all at once”, in the context of a unitary act (ΙΙΙ 8.8.8–30), and that this apprehension completely bypasses the differentiations that characterize the discursive grasp of their meanings as expressed when they are propositionally articulated. Therefore this apprehension does not involve any propositional determinations or entailments (Ι 3.5.1–18, IV 9.5.12–23) but is rather the joint apprehension of the already intertwined intelligible objects, in other words a complex network of truths combined in a unitary intellective act. It is similar to how vision is able to perceive at once a composite object, such as a face, even before analyzing it into its individual constituent components (V 8.4.4–11). Intellection does not distinguish between a truth’s content and its cause (the “why”), given that both necessarily coexist in the unitary apprehension and comprehension of that truth (VI 7.2.3–12, 9.17–21). It is only on the lower psychic level of “reasoning” (dianoia) that these truths may be expressed as distinct propositions and theorems, where the overall comprehensive contemplation is analyzed discursively into propositional formulations (V 8.6.9–15). Even the language of myths can be employed to present the holistic synchronic structure of the intelligible in the form of temporally discrete episodes (III 5.9.24–29, III 7.6.21–26, V 1.4.26–33, 6.19–22, VI 7.35.27–32). It is in this sense that the life of the soul can be regarded as an “image” or reflection of intellective life (V 1.3.6–12).

The basic categories that govern the formation of the complex unity of Intellect are identified by Plotinus with the five “greatest genera” (megista genē) originally introduced in Plato’s Sophist (II 6.1.1–8, V 1.4.34–43, V 9.10.10–14. VI 2.8.25–46, VI 7.13.17–34). These are Being—which determines each Form as what it is in itself, but also as the cause of being for everything that participates in it—Motion—which corresponds to Being’s procession from the first Principle, but also to its active coexistence with the other Forms—Rest—which expresses stillness, that is, the abiding of each being in what it is so that it always corresponds to its definition—(V 1.7.25–26, VI 2.7.26–45); and, finally, Sameness and Difference—through which each Form is correlated with the rest so that, in combination with them, it creates a network of ordered genera and species (III 7.3.8–11, VI 2.8.25–49). These greatest genera coexist jointly in each of the Forms of the intelligible realm, and they are thereby its constituent building blocks. On the other hand, the arrangement of the Forms inside the intelligible realm is further determined by the arrangement of eidetic numbers (V 1.5.6–17, V 5.5.7–19). These prescribe the positions the Forms are called on to occupy within the overall network of entities that comprise the “Perfect Living Organism” (VI 6.9.23–37), that is, the intelligible model on the basis of which the Demiurge, i.e., Intellect as an active contemplative entity, fashions the sensible universe (V 9.9.3–8). The “being” of each intelligible entity forms part of an arithmetically ordered structure (VI 6.3.2, 17.23–32).

The Intellect and its objects, qua contemplating subject and contemplated object, respectively, although inseparably linked to each other, are functionally discrete (V 1.4.26–34, V 3.10.9–16, V 4.2.9–12, V 6.1.7–23, VI 9.2.36–37), thus creating space for the appearance of a multitude of intelligible entities. Yet it is precisely this inherent duality of the Intellect qua hypostasis that renders it unsuitable for the role of the first principle of everything. Because such a principle ought to be utterly unitary, inasmuch as any multiplicity must, of logical necessity, be posterior to something simpler and more unitary (see FP1). This means that the first principle will have to be something that also transcends Intellect (VI 9.6.42–54) and its correlated intelligible Essence. Intellect, then, results from the power of something that comes before it and is more unitary than it. The atemporal process through which this production is accomplished is complex, however, and it involves different stages that, among other things, determine the dynamic nature of the Intellect. During the first stage, the first principle gives rise to something, whose only defining characteristic is its otherness to this principle (cf. FP3). In other words, it gives rise to something that is fundamentally non-One, something that lacks any element of unity. Something of this kind cannot but be utterly shapeless and unarticulated, given that each shape or articulation is governed by some manner of unity. This is why this early stage, from which the Intellect is to result, is sometimes called “intelligible matter” (ΙΙ 4.4.2–11), so as to emphasize, by analogy with the matter of bodies, its complete formlessness. At the same time, however, this intelligible matter owes its emergence to its otherness vis-à-vis the first principle, hence it is dependent on it as an activity that is “produced” by it (see SP2). Nonetheless, because in the primordial One—which, as we will see, is the first principle—there can be no “internal” activity, insofar as no distinction between “essence” and “activity” can obtain in it (Ι 7.1.15–20, V 6.6.1–11), this derivative and “external” activity is the “first” activity that appears after it, as an effulgence of its inexhaustible dynamism (cf. FP4) (see I 8.2.21, III 9.9.7–12, V 1.6.28–30, V 3.5.35, 12.27–41, 15.6, V 5.5.19–23, VI 7.18.12, 40.20–30). It thereby constitutes an activity not of the Good, but arising from the Good (ek tagathoū) (VI 7.21.5). The undifferentiated nature of this activity causes it to be bereft of specific content, which is why it is described as “unformed sight” and “unlimited life” (V 3.11.12, V 4.2.6, VI 7.17.13–15). However, this activity possesses an innate propensity for reversion to its origin (cf. SP3), and for this reason it is dubbed “only desire” (V 3.11.12), which, however, is accompanied by a still convoluted prefiguration of the possibilities contained in it (V 3.11.1–10).

In the second stage of the Intellect’s formation, its activity can be analyzed into further constituents: the stability of the Intellect’s persistence in what constitutes it as Being (stasis or monē; cf. SP1), and the abovementioned propensity for reversion to its origin (epistrophē) (V 5.5.17–19), which culminates in a “contemplative beholding” (horasis or theōria) of that origin (III 8.11.1–2, V 1.7.5–6, V 2.1.9–12, V 3.11.9–12). Since the Intellect is unable to apprehend what it beholds in its absolute unity, what it contemplates is ultimately analyzed into a multitude of interconnected truths that are identified with the beings Intellect itself encompasses (V 1.5.18–19, V 3.11.1–16, VI 7.15.18–22, 16.19–17.36). Thus, through its activation, Intellect becomes fully what it is: a perfectly active Intellect constituted as a multifarious unity. And in that sense it can be regarded as self-subsistent, meaning that it makes itself perfect as what it is (V 1.7.11–17).

This self-constituting activity of the Intellect is also called Life (V 6.5.16–19, V 8.4.36–48, VI 2.21.24–37), and is sometimes identified with what Plotinus calls “eternity” (III 7.2–6), in order to emphasize its atemporality, that is, the fact that its parts are always jointly present (V 1.4.21–25, V 9.10.9–11), whereas the supreme One is prior even to eternity (VI 8.20.24–25). Life, then, qua activation of the Intellect, is identified with it, so that Intellect and its activity can together comprise one and the same Being (V 3.6.5–7, 31–35).

7. The First Principle of Everything: the One, or the Good

The extreme transcendence of the First Principle in respect to everything entails a series of very challenging problems with which Plotinus repeatedly grapples in various parts of his work, each time attempting to approach them from a slightly different perspective. In doing so, he has bequeathed us an exciting testimony of his unremitting philosophical reckoning with the question of the limits of intellection and of the verbal formulation of our thoughts (V 3.13.1–12, 14.1–19, V 5.6.23–34, VI 7.38.1–9, VI 8.8.12–21, 13.1–11, VI 9.3.49–54, 5.38–40; see O’Meara 1990: 147–52).

As we have seen, on the basis of FP1, every cause must be simpler than its effect, otherwise it would forfeit its explanatory function. The reason for this is that a cause that is more complex than the effect it brings about would fail to account for that effect, for it would lead to even greater compositeness and complexity. A result of this line of reasoning is that the First Principle has to be utterly uncompounded, that is, the absolute One (V 1.8.25–6, V 3.15.26–16.5). The absolute unity that characterizes the first principle of everything, though, renders it inaccessible to our normal intellective or ratiocinative powers, hence any reference to it will necessarily be couched in metaphors, similes, and other such catachrestic modes of expression.

The first question that arises is why should anything emerge from the first principle: could it not remain perpetually and entirely secluded in itself? Plotinus’s response is that the first principle has such unlimited power that it would be impossible for it (on the basis of FP4, mentioned in the Second Digression) to not “express” itself as some kind of “outflow” in the incessant activity that originates from it (V 2.1.7–9); yet this effluence also constantly seeks (on the basis of FP3) to revert to its origin. This original Otherness has the characteristics of an utterly shapeless and unarticulated multiplicity, yet one whose reversion to the One gradually imparts on it elements of unity, echoes of the original unity of the One. Eventually, these echoes articulate it into a whole of interconnected parts, thus comprising the hypostasis of the Intellect. It is clear, however, that if anything outside the first principle is to exist, it will have to be something other than the One, and therefore non-One, which means something intrinsically multiple. Hence, the Intellect is constituted as a “multiple unity” (hen polla) (V 1.8.26, V 3.15.22, VI 2.15.14, VI 6.13.52–53, VI 7.14.11–12), which allows for the further diffusion of the inexhaustible dynamism of the One through its organized structures.

According to Plotinus, the absolute unity of the primordial One also entails its complete self-sufficiency because it makes it such as to be lacking in nothing (II 9.1.19, III 8.11.15–16, V 3.13.17, V 4.1.12, V 5.12.40–44, V 6.4.1–2). It follows that, on account of this self-sufficiency, there is no other good for the One; in other words, there is nothing outside itself that it seeks after (VI 8.7.38–46, VI 9.6.24–27). In contrast, the One constitutes the object of the striving of all other things (Ι 7.1.4–10). The One, then, is what is good for everything which is other than itself, by already encompassing everything that is good. This entails, however, that the One is identified with the absolute Good (VI 9.6.12–20). We thus arrive at the identification of the absolute One as the logical origin of everything with the One described in the First Hypothesis of Plato’s Parmenides, and with the Form of the Good introduced in the sixth book of the Republic as what is “beyond being”. The One is the supreme ontological principle, which grants to all intelligible entities their being and renders them knowable (I 7.1.19–20, III 8.9.2, 10.2–3, V 1.8.7–8, V 3.11.28, 12.47–48, V 4.2.2–3, V 5.6.11, V 6.6.30, V 8.1.3–4, VI 7.17.10–11, 37.23–24, VI 8.9.27–28, 16.34–36), while also being a universal productive power (III 8.10.1–14), which is radically different from the things that arise from it (III 8.9.39–54, V 2.1.1–2, V 3.11.14–21, 13.2–3, V 4.2.31–43, V 5.13.33–36). However, whereas each being is something specific and distinct from the rest, the One is nothing specific, constituting solely and simply the prerequisite for the existence of everything else (V 3.12.47–52, V 5.6.1–15).

In light of the role the One has in it, Plotinus’ ontological system can be described as utterly monistic, but also as “productive”, because everything originates from a single and absolutely unitary first principle which does not depend on, nor presupposes, anything outside itself, but is, in and of itself, “the (productive) power of all things” (dunamis pantōn) (III 8.10.1, V 1.7.9–10, V 3.15.32–35, V 4.1.36, 2.38, V 5.10.10–22, VI 8.1.10–11), and cause even of itself (VI 8. 14.41–42). One implication of this is the necessity of what results from it (on the basis of FP3 and FP4), and at the same time its total freedom, inasmuch as the principle’s activity is not limited by anything external to it, being determined solely by its nature as the primal Good. In fact, Plotinus goes so far as to identify the first Principle with its own completely unfettered “will” (boulēsis) (VI 8.21.12–16; cf. Coope 2020: 88–94).

One way to discursively approach the One is to provide arguments for its totally unitary and simple nature by relying precisely on its role as the absolutely primordial first Principle. As the cause of everything (V 5.13.35–36, VI 9.6.55) it must be prior (ontologically, not temporally) to the things that result from it (on the basis of FP1), in such a way that its presence can justify the realization of any given outcome. It follows that everything ought to be “other”, that is, all things must differ from it (on the basis of FP3), so that they may result from it. This leads us to the negative conception of this first Principle as that which is different from all the things that derive their being from it, which means different from everything (III 8.9.48–54, V 1.7.19, V 3.11.18, V 4.1.5–6). Since all predicates refer to beings, that is, to things that “are” something, in one way or another, no predicate can be accurately attributed to it, insofar as it transcends everything (V 3.31.2, V 4.2.39–40, V 5.13.20–32).

To conclude, then, although direct intellective apprehension of the first principle is impossible, reason is in a position to devise techniques through which it can manage to approach, to a certain degree, its unfathomable nature (VI 7.36.6–8). In parallel, through “cathartic” practices, humans can develop (I 3.17.37–38, VI 7.34.1–4, VI 9.3.14–27, 9.50–60) abilities that allow a complete, experiential “union” or “contact” with it (V 3.10.42–44, 17.25–28, VI 7.34.8–21, 36.8–21).

8. Conclusion

We need to keep in mind that any attempt, such as this, that seeks to present Plotinus’ philosophical system by reference to a hierarchical arrangement of the various modes of “being”, viz. to the so-called “hypostases”, and to the peculiar kind of unity that informs each of these, runs the risk of overlooking the dynamic character of the whole. For we ought to keep in mind that the different ontological levels are held together by a dual tendency that emerges in each of them, a tendency that connects them with those that precede and those that come after them. In fact, at each ontological level we can observe a tendency of “procession” (proodos), or decline towards the lower hypostasis (through the implementation of FP3 and SP2), but also a countervailing aspiration of reversion and “ascent” towards the higher one (cf. SP3), through which a given hypostasis is constituted and ultimately preserved, or “abides” in what it is (cf. SP1). These three stages of “abiding”, “procession”, and “reversion” comprise a dialectical schema that runs through Plotinus’ entire system, endowing it with remarkable cohesiveness and consistency (see Hadot 1960). Thus, the “hypostasis” of the soul, for instance, is derived from the secondary activity of the Intellect’s action, while at the same time it realizes itself as the sort of entity it is on account of its tendency to re-ascend to Intellect through its contemplation. This contemplative activity is what imparts to this hypostasis the characteristic kind of discursive unity that distinguishes it. The soul, in turn, besides engaging in this self-constituting activity, manifests its solicitude for what lies beneath it in the form of its secondary activity. This secondary activity results in the production of an “image” of the soul, which brings it into contact with corporeality and ultimately “produces” matter itself (ΙΙΙ 4.1.5–17, ΙΙΙ 9.3.7–13; on this point, see O’Brien 1991). Finally, a further expression of the dynamic character of this hypostasis is “love” (erōs). The soul’s unremitting dedication, as well as that of all other ontological gradients, is expressed through its love which is directly focused on the supreme principle, i.e., the Good (ΙΙΙ 5.4.18–25, V 5.12.7–44). Thus love constitutes the main motive for the re-ascent to the Good through “reversion”. This is because, apart from the soul, whose pursuit is motivated by Beauty (Ι 6.9.34–43, V 8.3.1–10, VI 7.32.1–10, 25–39; see Armstrong 1975: 159–62), even Intellect itself tends to elevate itself to the Good by transcending itself and thereby entering a state of inspired “inebriation” (V 1.6.50–53, VI 7.35.19–27; see O’Meara 2022, 120–1). Therefore love is elevated to the status of a universal tendency of all things that has as its object the Good in itself, within whose perspective everything is coordinated and conjoined, in imitation of its transcendent unity.

In this way Plotinus’ philosophy is revealed as a comprehensive conception of reality as a whole, grounded on certain fundamental first principles. It develops into a rather sophisticated system of interrelated conclusions that jointly attempt to account for the appearance and constitution of all the different phenomena that comprise the world that surrounds us. It furthermore seeks to prescribe the basic directions along which human life may be organized so as to become more consonant with our truest and at the same time most intimate aspirations.

Bibliography

A. Primary Literature

The standard critical edition of Plotinus’ works is: Plotini Opera, 3 volumes, Greek text edited by Paul Henry and Hans-Rudolf Schwyzer, Oxford 1964–82 (editio minor). The editio maior (Bruxelles & Paris: L’Édition Universelle & Desclée de Brouwer 1951–73) provides a full account of the primary manuscript readings.

English translation with Greek facing text: Plotinus, 7 volumes, by A. H. Armstrong, Cambridge, MA: Loeb Classical Library, 1968–88.

The most recent English translation with no Greek facing text: Plotinus. The Enneads, translated by George Boys-Stones, John M. Dillon, Lloyd P. Gerson, R. A. King, Andrew Smith and James Wilberding, general editor Lloyd P. Gerson, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2018.

A recent French translation with useful notes: Plotin. Traités, 9 volumes, by Luc Brisson and J.-F. Pradéau et al., Paris: Flammarion, 2002–2020.

On Porphyry’s Life of Plotinus see the two-volume collection of essays edited by L. Brisson, M.-O. Goulet-Cazé, R. Goulet, D. O’Brien et al., Porphyre: La Vie de Plotin, Paris: J. Vrin, 1982–1992.

There is an increasing number of Translations including Introductions and Commentaries on separate treatises of the Enneads:

  • A French collection of such volumes, following the chronological order of the treatises, was started in 1988 under the direction of Pierre Hadot: Les écrits de Plotin, Paris: Les editions du Cerf; it was continued after 2016 by the Librairie philosophique J. Vrin under the direction of Dominic O’Meara, Gwenaëlle Aubry, Anne-Lise Darras-Worms and François Balaudé. 18 volumes have appeared until now.
  • An English collection named “The Enneads of Plotinus with Philosophical Commentaries”, comprising separate treatment of individual treatises, has been undertaken since 2012 by Parmenides Publishing, Las Vegas and Zurich, under the direction of John M. Dillon and Andrew Smith. 15 volumes are available so far.
  • A new Budé edition of Plotinus’ works has begun to appear in 2017 under the direction of L. Ferroni and J.-M. Narbonne, with two volumes available so far: Plotin, Œuvres complètes, Paris: Les Belles Lettres.

See further:

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    • 2014, Volume 1, Elizabeth Key Fowden and Nicolas Pilavachi (trans), Princeton/Oxford: Princeton University Press. First published in Greek under the titles Porphyriou: Peri tou Plōtinou biou (1991), Plōtinou: Enneas Prōtē (1994), Plōtinou: Enneas Deutera (1997), and Plōtinou: Enneas Tritē (2004) by The Academy of Athens, Athens. doi:10.1515/9781400852512
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  • –––, 1990, “Le problème du discours sur l’indicible chez Plotin”, Revue de Théologie et de Philosophie, 122(2): 145–156.
  • O’Meara, Dominic J., 1996, “The Hierarchical Ordering of Reality in Plotinus”, in Gerson 1996: 66–81 (ch. 3). doi:10.1017/CCOL0521470935.004
  • –––, 2000, “Scepticism and Ineffability in Plotinus”, Phronesis, 45(3): 240–251. doi:10.1163/156852800510207
  • –––, 2022, “Love in Plotinus’ Thought”, in Platonic Love from Antiquity to the Renaissance, Carl Séan O’Brien and John Dillon (eds), Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press, 111–124. doi:10.1017/9781108525596.009
  • Remes, Pauliina, 2005, “Plotinus On The Unity And Identity Of Changing Particulars”, in Oxford Studies In Ancient Philosophy XXVIII, David Sedley (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 273–302. doi:10.1093/oso/9780199281930.003.0010
  • Rist, John M., 1983, “Metaphysics and Psychology in Plotinus’ Treatment of the Soul”, in Graceful Reason: Essays in Ancient and Medieval Philosophy Presented to Joseph Owens, CSSR, on the Occasion of His Seventy-Fifth Birthday and the Fiftieth Anniversary of His Ordination (Papers in Mediaeval Studies 4), Lloyd P. Gerson (ed.), Toronto, Ont: Pontifical Institute of Mediaeval Studies, 135–151 (ch. 7).
  • Schroeder, Frederic M., 1987, “Synousia, Synaisthaesis and Synesis: Presence and Dependence in the Plotinian Philosophy of Consciousness”, in Philosophie, Wissenschaften, Technik. Philosophie (Historische Einleitung; Platonismus) (Aufstieg und Niedergang der Römischen Welt, II 36.1), Wolfgang Haase (ed.), Berlin/Boston: De Gruyter, 677–699. doi:10.1515/9783110861570-016
  • Strange, Steven K., 1994, “Plotinus on the Nature of Eternity and Time”, in Aristotle in Late Antiquity (Studies in Philosophy and the History of Philosophy 27), Lawrence P. Schrenk (ed.), Washington, DC: Catholic University of America Press, 22–53.
  • Tornau, Christian, 1998, “Wissenschaft, Seele, Geist. Zur Bedeutung einer Analogie bei Plotin (Enn. IV 9,5 und VI 2,20)”, Göttinger Forum für Altertumswissenschaft, 1: 87–111. doi:10.14628/GFA.1998.0.77012
  • –––, 2009, “Qu’ est-ce qu’un individu? Unité, individualité et conscience de soi dans la métaphysique plotinienne de l’âme”, Les Études Philophiques, 2009(3): 333–60.
  • –––, 2016, “Seelenspur und Aufnahmefähigkeit: ein plotinischer Zirkel?”, in Seele und Materie im Neuplatonismus (Heidelberger Forschungen 39), Jens Halfwassen, Tobias Dangel, and Carl O’Brien (eds), Heidelberg: Winter, 135–160.
  • Tuominen, Miira, 2022, “Virtue and Happiness”, in Gerson and Wilberding 2022: 363–385 (ch. 15). doi:10.1017/9781108770255.016
  • Wilberding, James, 2008, “Automatic Action in Plotinus”, in Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy, David Sedley (ed.), Oxford: Oxford University Press, 373–408. doi:10.1093/oso/9780199544875.003.0011

C. Reference

  • Blumenthal, H. J., 1987, “Plotinus in the Light of Twenty Years’ Scholarship, 1951 – 1971”, in Philosophie, Wissenschaften, Technik. Philosophie (Historische Einleitung; Platonismus) (Aufstieg und Niedergang der römischen Welt, II 36.1), Wolfgang Haase (ed.), Berlin/Boston: De Gruyter, 528–570. doi:10.1515/9783110861570-013
  • Corrigan, Kevin, 1987, “The Course of Plotinian Scholarship from 1971 to 1986”, in Philosophie, Wissenschaften, Technik. Philosophie (Historische Einleitung; Platonismus) (Aufstieg und Niedergang der römischen Welt, II 36.1), Wolfgang Haase (ed.), Berlin/Boston: De Gruyter, 571–623. doi:10.1515/9783110861570-014
  • Dufour, Richard, 2002, Plotinus: A Bibliography, 1950–2000, Revised edition, Leiden/Boston: Brill. [updated version of Dufour 2002 available online]
  • Sleeman, J. H. and Gilbert Pollet, 1980, Lexicon Plotinianum (Ancient and Medieval Philosophy: Series 1, 2), Leiden: E. J. Brill and Leuven: Leuven University Press.

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