1. Defenses of prioritarianism include Adler (2012, 2019, 2022a); Adler and Holtug (2019); Arneson (2000, 2007, 2022); Holtug (2010); Hooker (2000); Hyams (2015); McKerlie (2007); Nebel (2017); O’Neill (2012); Parfit (2000, 2012); Porter (2011, 2012); Segall (2015); Weirich (1983); and Williams (2012). See also Adler and Norheim (2022a) for a survey of prioritarianism’s implications for public policy.

2. Space constraints preclude addressing a number of topics: picking a specific transformation function within the class of such functions (Adler 2022a); shifting from lifetime to time-slice well-being (Adler 2012; Andrić and Herlitz 2022; Holtug 2010; McKerlie 1997, 2001a, 2001b, 2007, 2013); adjusting well-being to take account of individual desert or opportunity (Adler 2018; Arneson 2007, 2022; Brunori, Ferreira, and Peragine 2022); shifting to a “local” prioritarianism that regulates distribution only within societies, rather than globally (Nagel 1991; cf. Holtug 2009); specifying prioritarianism as a deontic rather than axiological view (Nebel 2017; Williams 2012); and, as mentioned, including non-human animals within the population of concern.

3. To be precise: (1) \(w_i (x) \ge w_j (y)\) if and only if \(i\) in \(x\) is at least as well off as \(j\) in \(y\), with \(i\) and \(j\) either the same individual (intrapersonal case) or distinct individuals (interpersonal case). (2) \(w_i (x) - w_j (y) \ge w_k (z) - w_l (zz)\) if and only if the difference between \(i\)’s well-being in \(x\) and \(j\)’s well-being in \(y\) is at least as large as the difference between \(k\)’s well-being in \(z\) and \(l\)’s well-being in \(zz\), with either \(i = j = k = l\) (intrapersonal case) or not \(i = j = k = l\) (interpersonal case).

4. Here are formal definitions. To say that \(g(\cdot)\) is strictly increasing means: if \(w\)* \(\gt w\), then \(g(w^*) \gt g(w)\). To say that \(g(\cdot)\) is strictly concave means: for all \(\alpha\), \(0 \lt \alpha \lt 1\), and for all \(w, w^*\) with \(w \ne w\)*, \(\alpha g(w) + (1-\alpha)g(w^*) \lt g(\alpha w + (1-\alpha)w^*)\). Strict concavity, thus defined, is equivalent to requiring that \(g(\cdot)\) have diminishing slope: if \(w \lt w^* \lt w^{**}\),

\[ \frac{g(w^{**}) - g(w^*)}{w^{**} - w^*} \lt \frac{g(w^*) - g(w)}{w^* - w}.\]

5. If \(P\) leads for sure to a higher well-being level for individual \(i\) than \(P^*, P\) is surely a better prospect in light of \(i\)’s well-being. Requiring \(h(\cdot)\) to be strictly increasing ensures that the expected value of \(h(w_i)\) is greater for \(P\) than \(P^*\) in this kind of case.

Having \(h(\cdot)\) vary among individuals creates difficulties, see Adler (2019, pp. 271–72), and we will therefore assume that \(h(\cdot)\) is a single function.

6. With Bernoulli dropped, the definition of EAP should presumably change to: the sum of \(g(\cdot)\) applied to individuals’ expected \(h(\cdot)\)-transformed well-being. (The idea behind EAP is to use a measure of the well-being value of each individual’s prospect as the input into \(g(\cdot)\).) The text accompanying this footnote describes the axiomatic properties of EAP thus reformulated.

7. We lack space to discuss Harsanyi’s Aggregation Theorem in detail here. (On the theorem, see generally Harsanyi 1955; Blackorby, Bossert, and Donaldson 2005, ch. 7; Broome 1991; Mongin and Pivato 2016; Weymark 1991). Roughly, it appeals both to the Ex Ante Pareto axiom and to expected utility theory as applied to the moral ranking of lotteries over outcomes, or of prospects, to characterize the moral-betterness ranking of outcomes. Harsanyi supposed the Aggregation Theorem to provide a defense of utilitarianism. That itself is disputed. What is true is that, with additional premises, including Bernoulli, the Aggregation Theorem supports utilitarianism. See Adler (2019, pp. 282–83) for a simple explanation, using outcome lotteries rather than prospects; the premises here are Expected Utility Decisionmaking; the existence of a measure of well-being \(w(\cdot)\) that represents intra- and interpersonal comparisons of well-being levels and differences; Bernoulli; Ex Ante Pareto; and Anonymity. If these premises are retained except for Bernoulli, now supposing instead that the ranking of prospects in light of individual \(i\)’s well-being conforms to the expected value of some function \(h(\cdot)\), with \(h(\cdot)\) strictly increasing and strictly concave, it follows that: the betterness ranking is prioritarian with \(h(\cdot)\) as the transformation function.