Property and Ownership

First published Mon Sep 6, 2004; substantive revision Wed Jan 21, 2026

Property is a general term for rules governing access to and control of material resources and other things of value. Because these rules are disputed, both in regard to their general shape and in regard to their particular application, there are interesting philosophical issues about the justification of property. Modern philosophical discussions focus mostly on the issue of the justification of private property rights (as opposed to common or collective property), which refer to a system that allocates particular objects like pieces of land to particular individuals to use and manage as they please, to the exclusion of others (even others who have a greater need for the resources), and to the exclusion also of any detailed control by society. Though these exclusions make the idea of private property seem problematic, philosophers have often argued that it is necessary for the ethical development of the individual, or for the creation of a social environment in which people can prosper as free and responsible agents.

1. Why Have Philosophers Taken an Interest in Property and Ownership?

There are three principal reasons why property and ownership are of philosophical interest. The first is conceptual or analytic. Given the prominent role that property has played in moral and political discourse concerning our normative interpersonal relations, one person to another, and in our relations to the state, it is a significant theoretical matter to determine the ‘nature’ as it were, of property and ownership. These issues will be addressed in Part 2. The second concerns the issue of distributive justice. The ‘just’ distribution of property is a hugely contentious matter that has generated a large literature in moral and philosophical discourse. This matter will be considered in Part 5. The third, which is perhaps the most important, is that property rights have figured prominently in the theories of many ‘great’ philosophers, from Grotius to Hegel, as foundations both for the basic interpersonal morality of individuals, one to another, and of political systems in general. This will be considered in Parts 3 and 4.

2. Issues of Analysis and Definition

More than most policy areas dealt with by political philosophers, the discussion of property is beset with definitional difficulties.

The first question we must ask is “What are the (proper) objects of property rules or property rights?” In terms of our common discourse, property rights are rights to physical things, objects, goods, parcels of land, and so on. Although of economic value, your right to your bank balance, company shares, and intellectual property rights are not on this view property rights: they cannot be physically touched, possessed, or occupied, so they do not belong. The second, broader, concept of property includes not only tangible things, but all alienable rights, that is, rights that can pass to another person. Such a concept would include the rights in your bank balance, patents and so on. Another way of explicating the latter concept of property would be to equate property rights with ‘alienable assets’. Anything that could pass to your creditors on insolvency would count, which by the same token would encompass all the rights that could be left by will or pass by inheritance. On neither view would such rights as the right to vote or the right to marry qualify as property rights. The former view emphasizes possessability as the hallmark of property: if it cannot be physically possessed, it is not property. The latter emphasizes alienability as its essence: if I have a right, but it can become yours, then it counts as property. One rationale for favouring the latter, broader, concept is that it spans the realm of our interactions with others that have been described as ‘personality-poor’ (Penner 1997a: ch 5) – where a right might just as well be someone else’s, it is a right that doesn’t (or doesn’t deeply) implicate one’s personality. Nevertheless, in what follows we shall largely work with the former concept, rights in physical resources, goods and land, as that is the one which has largely figured in the discourse under review.

Here a word must be said about property in land. Everyone, including children from a young age, understands the idea of property rights when it comes to all those possessable things we encounter throughout our daily lives, which the common law calls ‘chattels’, such as the furniture in the house, the clothes in our wardrobes, the plates and glasses on the table, our books, pens, laptops and mobile phones, and quantities of wheat or oil. It is my pen or it is someone else’s, and it is easy to grasp the idea of a right to exclusive possession, that if it is mine others have an obligation not to take it or damage it without my consent.

Property in defined parcels of land is very different. One might say that land is ‘possessed’, but a moment’s thought requires us to think of this as a term of art meaning occupation. A person can occupy land, alone or with others, and just as we understand the trespassory rules which give effect to the rights we have in objects, so we understand similar trespassory rules in relation to land: the obligation you have not to enter my land, damage it, and, in particular, oust me from possession and take possession yourself. But land is a very complicated object of property rights. To name just a few of its features which complicate any regime of rules in relation to land, and thus the titles people have to land:

  • Land is immovable; indeed the name civil law gives to parcels of land is ‘immovables’.
  • Outside Antarctica, parcels of land generally form part of a state’s territory, and its jurisdictional rules will significantly shape what title to land amounts to.
  • Rights or titles to land are extremely malleable. It is, for an example, doubtful that rights to land under feudal systems amounted to property rights at all. People were attached to the land in various capacities (serf, lord of a manor, seigneur, the king) but they did not own it.
  • The landed surface of the earth is also the human environment, each parcel related extensively to others in terms of the ecosystem of which it is a part.
  • Whilst some non-land possessables can last forever and some, such as works of art, are intentionally preserved to try to ensure this, most such things do not; they wear out, are consumed, and so on. Land lasts forever, although it can be ‘destroyed’ in the colloquial sense of being made unsuitable or dangerous for occupation or use.
  • Possessables typically have clear-cut ‘boundaries’ as part of the nature of the thing in question. Some parcels of land have natural boundaries, but most boundaries are artificial and have to be maintained.
  • Land is contiguous, in the sense that plots of land will abut each other, so that land owners have neighbors.
  • Whilst the use of some possessables requires infrastructure—think of your mobile phone—rights to land necessarily do, if only in terms of roads providing access.

These multiple features ramify in a number of ways, but the most important way is this: since a parcel of land can exist forever, can be consolidated with other parcels, and has a location, relating an owner to the state, to neighbors, and to the environment, any owner’s use of land will necessarily have consequential effects for others, both in space and in time.

The second issue is to distinguish possible sets of rules regarding property, or different property ‘regimes’.

Strictly speaking, ‘property’ is a general term for the rules that govern people’s access to and control of things like land, natural resources, the means of production, manufactured goods, and also (on some accounts) texts, ideas, inventions, and other intellectual products. Disagreements about their use are likely to be serious because resource-use matters to people. They are particularly serious where the objects in question are both scarce and necessary. Some have suggested that property relations only make sense under conditions of scarcity (Hume 1739 [2007], SB 488. 494). But other grounds of conflict are possible: there may be disagreements about how a given piece of land should be used, which stem from the history or symbolic significance of that piece of land, whether land in general is scarce or not. (Intellectual property provides an example of property rules that do not respond directly to scarcity; moreover unlike material objects, the objects of intellectual property are not crowdable, for their use by any one person does not preclude their use by any number of others.)[1]

Any society with an interest in avoiding conflict needs such a system of rules. This necessity is sometimes cited as an argument in favor of private property (Benn & Peters 1959: 155). In fact, all it establishes is that there ought to be property rules of some kind: private property rules are one variety. Some human societies have existed for millennia, satisfying the needs and wants of all their members, without private property or anything like it in land or the other major resources of economic life. So the first step in sound argumentation about property is distinguishing those arguments which support the existence of property in general from arguments which support the existence of a system of a specific kind (Waldron 1988; Pateman 2002).

There are any number of possible regimes of property rules; Harris (1996: ch 2) considers six. Yet three species of property arrangement have generally been considered as generic alternatives: common property, collective property, and private property. In a common property system, resources are governed by rules whose point is to make them available for use by all or any members of the society. A tract of common land, for example, may be used by everyone in a community for grazing cattle or gathering food. A park may be open to all for picnics, sports or recreation. The aim of any restrictions on use is simply to secure fair access for all, to prevent anyone from using the common resource in a way that would preclude its use by others, and to ensure that the resource is not overused and so to avoid the so-called ‘tragedy of the commons’ (Hardin 1968). Collective property is a different idea: here the community as a whole determines how important resources are to be used. These determinations are made on the basis of the social interest through mechanisms of collective decision-making—anything from a leisurely debate among the elders of a tribe to the forming and implementing of a Soviet-style ‘Five-Year Plan’. Colletive or common ownership of the Earth has figured in discussions of global justice (Risse 2012; Olsthoorn 2018).

In a private property system, rules are organized around the idea that various contested resources are assigned to the decisional authority of particular individuals (or families or firms). Thomas Merrill (2012) calls this ‘the property strategy’ and contrasts it with bureaucratic governance or the management of resources through group consensus. In a system of private property, the person to whom a given object is assigned (e.g., the person who found it or made it) has control over the object: it is for her to decide what should be done with it, and she is not understood to be acting as an agent or official of the society. She may act on her own initiative without giving anyone else an explanation, or she may enter into cooperative arrangements with others, just as she likes. She may even transfer this right of decision to someone else, in which case that person acquires the same rights she had. In general the right of a proprietor to decide as she pleases about the resource that she owns applies whether or not others are affected by her decision. If Jennifer owns a steel factory, it is for her to decide (in her own interest) whether to close it or to keep the plant operating, even though a decision to close may have the gravest impact on her employees and on the prosperity of the local community.

Though private property is a system of individual decision-making, it is still a system of social rules. The owner is not required to rely on her own strength to vindicate her right to make self-interested decisions about the object assigned to her: if Jennifer’s employees occupy the steel factory to keep it operating despite her wishes, she can call the police and have them evicted; she does not have to do this herself or even pay for it herself. So private property is continually in need of public justification—first, because it empowers individuals to make decisions about the use of scarce resource in a way that is not necessarily sensitive to others’ needs or the public good; and second, because it does not merely permit that but deploys public force at public expense to uphold it.

Plainly private property and collective control are not all-or-nothing alternatives. In every modern society, some resources are governed by common property rules (e.g., streets and parks), some are governed by collective property rules (e.g., military bases and artillery pieces), and some are governed by private property rules (toothbrushes and bicycles). Also, there are variations in the degree of freedom that a private owner has over the resources assigned to him. Obviously, an owner’s freedom is limited by background rules of conduct: I may not use my gun to kill another person. These are not strictly property rules. More to the point are things like zoning restrictions, which amount in effect to the imposition of a collective decision about certain aspects of the use of a given resource. The owner of a building in an historic district may be told, for example, that she can use it as a shop, a home, or a hotel but she may not knock it down and replace it with a skyscraper. In this case, we may still say that the historic building counts as private property; but if too many other areas of decision about its use were also controlled by public agencies, we would be more inclined to say that it was really subject to a collective property rule, with the ‘owner’ functioning as steward of society’s decisions.

It is probably a mistake therefore to insist on any definition of private property that implies a proprietor has absolute control over his resource.[2] Some jurists have even argued that the terms ‘property’ and ‘ownership’ should be eliminated from the technical discourse of the law (Grey 1980). They say that calling someone the ‘owner’ of a resource conveys no exact information about her rights in relation to that resource: a corporate owner is not the same as an individual owner; the owner of intellectual property has a different array of rights than the owner of an automobile; and even with regard to one and the same resource, the rights (and duties) of a landlord who owes nothing on his property might be quite different from those of a mortgagor.

The eliminative proposal makes sense to this extent: the position of a private owner is best understood not as a single right to the exclusive use and control of the object in question, but as a bundle of rights, which may vary from case to case (Honoré 1961).

In recent literature, the ‘bundle of rights’ conception has encountered resistance (Penner 1996; Smith 2012; Klein & Robinson 2011). Some theorists want to insist that property is better conceived, as it is in colloquial usage, as a substantial relation between a person and a thing (Smith 2012). This can be put forward on analytic grounds or for ideological reasons; on the latter approach it is said that the importance of property for a free society is obscured when the ownership relation is treated as a divisible bundle of rights (Attas 2006).

Theorists who persevere with the ‘bundle of rights’ analysis nevertheless present some sticks in the bundle as more important than others: the right to exclude is usually seen as the key to ownership, even if it is one among many other rights and legal relations that property comprises (Penner 1997a: ch 4). It is the aspect of ownership that has the greatest impact on others (Waldron 1993). Other theorists are more skeptical about this. Katz (2008) and Dagan (2011) suggest that in our analysis of private property we should place less emphasis on the right to exclude and more on the owner’s power of agenda-setting so far as the use of a given resource is concerned. On any account, ‘exclusive use’ is a complex idea. Its implications vary from context to context and from object to object: we actually have a plurality of property arrangements, striking different balances between owners’ and others’ interests (Dagan 2013, 2021). And this thought takes us to our third issue: the basic structure of a property right in modern, ‘liberal’, societies.

Title to tangible property typically comprises consists of one (Hohfeldian) liberty which is protected with one (Hohfeldian) claim right, and two (Hohfeldian) powers (Penner 2020, ch 1):

  1. The liberty to use (limited by background rules of conduct which we have already noticed);
  2. The right to exclusive possession, which correlates with a duty upon all others not to act inconsistently with this right, by committing an act of trespass or dispossession;
  3. The power to license others to do what would otherwise amount to a trespass, as for example when you invite someone into your house for dinner;
  4. The power to transfer the title to someone else.

The nature of this title is a default since in certain cases we find not all of the incidents present or that they are modified in some way. For example, jurisdictions which recognize a ‘right to roam’ limit the right to exclusive possession of land. Besides this ‘default’ title, which may be regarded as the right of ‘ownership’, there are other interests that may be created; we shall consider just three examples, security interests, easements, and profits.

A security interest is an interest in the property of another which ‘secures’ the performance of an obligation. The most well-known security interests secure the repayment of money made by way of loan, for example a mortgage over land. In other cases, the secured property is colloquially referred to as the ‘collateral’ for the specific loan. A security interest in property secures the payment obligation because if the borrower defaults on his payments, the lender will have the right to take possession of the property, sell it, and retain as much of the sale proceeds as is required to clear the outstanding debt.

An easement is a right to make use of another’s land which is less than the right to exclusive possession. An example easy to understand is a right of way, where landowner A grants a right of way to landowner B allowing B to cross A’s land to gain quicker access to another parcel of land B owns. Once created, this easement will bind successors in title of both A and B. If A transfers his land to C, then C will be bound to give effect to the easement, and if B transfers his land to D, D will have the benefit of the easement, and will be allowed to cross C’s land.

A profit (or to use the longer term employing common law French, a ‘profit à prendre’) is the right to take physical materials from the land of another, traditionally things such as timber or minerals. The profit will bind successors in title just as an easement does. In describing the effect of these interests in land, common law lawyers say that these interests ‘run with the land’ to indicate that the grant of an easement or a profit is not only personal as between the parties to the grant, but binds successors in title.

It is obviously socially important which such interests can be made to run with the land in this way. In feudal England (we spare the reader the legal terminology), a landowner might have the obligation to provide soldiers (‘knights’) to the King, and this obligation would run with the land. This bespeaks a very different attitude to land ownership than the one that prevails today. But the possibilities are limited only by one’s imagination. These examples show that the default title we have described can be augmented by further powers, to grant security interests, easements and so on. In keeping with the ‘bundles of rights’ metaphor, we might say that ownership also comprises a ‘bundle of powers’.

Most strikingly, perhaps, the owner is legally empowered to transfer the whole bundle of rights in the object she owns to somebody else—as a gift or by sale or as a legacy after death. With this power, a private property system becomes self-perpetuating. After an initial assignment of objects to owners, there is no further need for the community or the state to concern itself with distributive questions. Objects will circulate as the whims and decisions of individual owners and their successive transferees dictate. The result may be that wealth is widely distributed or it may be that wealth is concentrated in a very few hands. It is part of the logic of private property that no-one has the responsibility to concern themselves with the big picture, so far as the distribution of resources is concerned. Society simply pledges itself to enforce the rights of exclusion that ownership involves wherever those rights happen to be. Any concern about the balance between rich and poor must be brought in as a separate matter of public policy (as tax and welfare policy or in extremis large scale redistribution). As we shall see, philosophers disagree as to whether this is an advantage or an indictment of private property systems.

At the furthest reaches of analysis, the concept of private property becomes quite contestable. Many people believe that ownership implies inheritance (see Part 5 below). But Mill once observed that the private property idea implied only

the right of each to his (or her) own faculties, to what he can produce by them, and to whatever he can get for them in a fair market; together with his right to give this to any other person if he chooses. (Mill 1848: bk 2, ch 1, §6 [1994: 28])

He said that passing the property of individuals who made no disposition of it during their lifetime to their children

may be a proper arrangement or not, but it is no consequence of the principle of private property. (ibid.)

Definitive resolution of such controversies is probably impossible. Some philosophers have suggested that certain concepts should be regarded as ‘essentially contested concepts’ (see Gallie 1956); if there is anything to this suggestion, private property might be one of them (see Waldron 1988: 51–2).

3. Historical Overview

There are extensive discussions of property in the writings of Plato, Aristotle, Aquinas, Hegel, Hobbes, Locke, Hume, Kant, Marx, and Mill. The range of justificatory themes they consider is very broad, and we shall begin with a summary.

The ancient authors speculated about the relation between property and virtue, a natural subject for discussion since justifying private property raises serious questions about the legitimacy of self-interested activity. Plato (Republic, 462b-c) argued that collective ownership was necessary to promote common pursuit of the common interest, and to avoid the social divisiveness that would occur “when some grieve exceedingly and others rejoice at the same happenings”. Aristotle responded by arguing that private ownership promotes virtues like prudence and responsibility:

[W]hen everyone has a distinct interest, men will not complain of one another, and they will make more progress, because every one will be attending to his own business. (Politics, 1263a)

Even altruism, said Aristotle, might be better promoted by focusing ethical attention on the way a person exercises his rights of private property rather than questioning the institution itself (ibid.). Aristotle also reflected on the relation between property and freedom, and the contribution that ownership makes to a person’s being a free man and thus suitable for citizenship. The Greeks took liberty to be a status defined by contrast with slavery, and for Aristotle, to be free was to belong to oneself, to be one’s own man, whereas the slave was by nature the property of another. Self-possession was connected with having sufficient distance from one’s desires to enable the practice of virtuous self-control. On this account, the natural slave was unfree because his reason could not prescribe a rule to his bodily appetites. Aristotle had no hesitation in extending this point beyond slavery to the conditions of “the meaner sort of workman.” Obsessed with need, the poor are “too degraded” to participate in politics like free men. “You could no more make a city out of paupers,” wrote Aristotle, “than out of slaves” (Politics, 1278a). They must be ruled like slaves, for otherwise their pressing and immediate needs will issue in envy and violence. Some of these themes have emerged more recently in civic republican theories, though modern theories of citizenship tend to begin with a sense of who should be citizens (all adult residents) and then proceed to argue that they should all have property, rather than using existing wealth as an independent criterion for the franchise (King & Waldron 1988).

In the medieval period, Thomas Aquinas continued discussion of the Aristotlean idea that virtue might be expressed in the use that one makes of one’s property. But Aquinas gave it a sharper edge. Not only do the rich have moral obligations to act generously, but the poor also have rights against the rich. Beginning from the premise that

[a]ccording to the natural order established by Divine Providence, inferior things are ordained for the purpose of succoring man’s needs…, (ST II-II, Q66.A1 resp)

Aquinas argued that no division of resources based on human law can prevail over the necessities associated with destitution. This is a theme which recurs throughout our tradition—most notably in Locke’s First Treatise on Government (Locke 1689: I, para. 42)—as an essential qualification of whatever else is said about the legitimacy of private property (Horne 1990).

In the early modern period, philosophers turned their attention to the way in which property might have been instituted, with Hobbes and Hume arguing that there is no natural ‘mine’ or ‘thine,’ and that property must be understood as the creation of the sovereign state (Hobbes 1642/1651]) or at the very least the artificial product of a convention

enter’d into by all the members of the society to bestow stability on the possession of…external goods, and leave every one in the peaceable enjoyment of what he may acquire by his fortune and industry. (Hume 1739 [2007], SB 399)

John Locke (1689), on the other hand, was adamant that property could have been instituted in a state of nature without any special conventions or political decisions.

Locke’s theory is widely regarded as the most interesting of the canonical discussions of property. In part this is a result of how he began his account; because he took as his starting point that God gave the world to men in common, he had to acknowledge from the outset that private entitlements pose a moral problem. How do we move from a common endowment to the ‘disproportionate and unequal Possession of the Earth’ that seems to go along with private property? Unlike some of his predecessors, Locke did not base his resolution of this difficulty on any theory of universal (even tacit) consent. Instead, in the most famous passage of his chapter on property, he gave a moral defense of the legitimacy of unilateral appropriation.

Though the Earth…be common to all Men, yet every Man has a Property in his own Person. This no Body has any Right to but himself. The Labour of his Body, and the Work of his Hands, we may say, are properly his. Whatsoever then he removes out of the State that Nature hath provided, and left it in, he hath mixed his Labour with, and joyned to it something that is his own, and thereby makes it his Property. It being by him removed from the common state Nature placed it in, it hath by this labour something annexed to it, that excludes the common right of other Men. (Locke 1689: II, para. 27)

The interest of Locke’s account lies in the way he combines the structure of a theory of first occupancy with an account of the substantive moral significance of labor. In the hands of writers like Samuel Pufendorf (1672 [1991: 84]), First Occupancy theory proceeded on the basis that the first human user of a natural resource—a piece of land, for example—is distinguished from all others in that he did not have to displace anyone else in order to take possession. It did not particularly matter how he took possession of it, or what sort of use he made of it: what mattered was that he began acting as its owner without dispossessing anyone else. Now although Locke used the logic of this account, it did matter for him that the land was cultivated or in some other way used productively. (For this reason, he expressed doubts whether indigenous hunters or nomadic peoples could properly be regarded as owners of the land over which they roamed.) This is partly because Locke identified the ownership of labor as something connected substantially to the primal ownership of self. But it was also because he thought the productivity of labor would help answer some of the difficulties which he saw in First Occupancy theory. Though the first occupier does not actually dispossess anyone, still his acquisition may prejudice other’s interests if there is not, in Locke’s words, “enough and as good left in common” for them to enjoy (Locke 1689: II, para. 27). Locke’s answer to this difficulty was to emphasize that appropriation by productive labor actually increased the amount of goods available in society for others (1689: II, para. 37). There is also something like a strand of moral desert in Locke’s theory: if one person fails to take advantage of an opportunity of resource-use or resource development, can that person really complain or demand compensation when the opportunity is taken up by someone else (de Jasay 2004)?

Immanuel Kant’s work on property is more formal and abstract than Locke’s and—at least until recently-it was less well-known. (But now see Byrd & Hruschka 2006 and Ripstein 2009.) Kant began by emphasizing a general connection between property and agency, maintaining that there would be an affront to agency and thus to human personality, if some system were not arrived at which could permit useful objects to be used (Weinrib 2018). He inferred from this that “it is a duty of right to act towards others so that what is external (usable) could also become someone’s” (Kant 1797 [1996], AK 6:252) Though this legitimated unilateral appropriation, it did so only in a provisional way. Since the appropriation of a resource as private property affects everyone else’s position (imposing duties on them that they would otherwise not have), it cannot acquire full legitimacy by unilateral action: it must be ratified by an arrangement which respects everyone’s interests in this matter. So the force of the principle requiring people to act so that external objects can be used as property also requires them to enter into a civil constitution, which will actually settle who is to be the owner of what on a basis that is fair to all.

G.W.F. Hegel’s account of property centers on the contribution property makes to the development of the self (1820 [1967], p 40, para. 41): “A person must translate his freedom into an external sphere in order to exist as Idea”, thus giving some sort of external reality to what would otherwise be the unexploited mere potentiality for individual freedom (Penner 1997a: ch 8; Brudner & Nadler 2013: ch 3). (‘Idea’ for Hegel, is what we apprehend when we understand something, for example beauty, not merely as an abstract concept but as a phenomenon in the real world. As regards a property right, this would be the apprehension of the right as it is instantiated in actual human affairs, in the real world.) These rather obscure formulations were taken up also by the English idealists, most notably by T.H. Green (1886 [1895]), who emphasized the contribution that ownership makes to ethical development, to the growth of the will and a sense of responsibility. But neither of these writers thought of the development of the individual person as the be-all and end-all of property. In both cases it was thought of as a stage in the growth of social responsibility. Both saw the freedom embodied in property as ultimately positive freedom—freedom to choose rationally and responsibly for the wider social good. In Karl Marx’s philosophy, Hegel’s sense of there being several stages in the growth of positive freedom is framed in terms of stages of social development rather than stages of the growth of individuals (Marx 1862). And for Marx, as for Plato, social responsibility in the exercise of private property rights is never enough. The whole trajectory of the development of modern society, says Marx, is towards large-scale cooperative labor. This may be masked by forms of property that treat vast corporations as private owners, but eventually this carapace will be abandoned and collectivist economic relations will emerge and be celebrated as such.

The general merits of private property versus socialism thus became a subject of genuine debate in the nineteenth and twentieth centuries. John Stuart Mill, with his characteristic open-mindedness treated communism as a genuine option, and he confronted objections to the collectivist ideal with the suggestion that the inequitable distribution of property in actually existing capitalist societies already partakes of many of these difficulties. He insisted however, that private property be given a fair hearing as well:

If…the choice were to be made between Communism…and the present state of society with all its sufferings and injustices,…all the difficulties, great or small, of Communism would be but as dust in the balance. But to make the comparison applicable, we must compare Communism at its best, with the regime of individual property, not as it is, but as it might be made…The laws of property have never yet conformed to the principles on which the justification of private property rests. (Mill 1848: bk II, ch 1, §2 [1994: 14–15)

Mill is surely right, at least so far as the aims of a philosophical discussion of property are concerned. Indeed, one way of looking at the history we have just briefly surveyed is that it is the history of successive attempts to tease out, from the mess of actually-existing maldistribution and exploitation, some sense of the true principles on which the justification of an ideal system of private property would rest, and a sense too of other aspects of moral enterprise which such an institution might serve.

Some have suggested that philosophers need not be interested in property in these ways. John Rawls argued that questions about the system of ownership are secondary or derivative questions, to be dealt with pragmatically rather than as issues in political philosophy (Rawls 1999: 235–42). Although every society has to decide whether the economy will be organized on the basis of markets and private ownership or on the basis of central collective control, there was little that philosophers could contribute to these debates. Philosophers, Rawls said, are better off discussing the abstract principles of justice that should constrain the establishment of any social institutions, than trying to settle a priori questions of social and economic strategy. His own suggestions favoring the institutions of ‘a property-owning democracy’ are put forward more as intermediate principles than as fundamentals of justice.

On the other hand, with the growing attention that is being paid in the discipline to public policy generally, it is difficult to deny that questions about property can be posed in terms that are abstract enough for philosophers to address. Though Rawls counsels us to talk about justice rather than property, in fact issues about property are inevitably implicated in some of the issues about justice that have preoccupied political philosophers in recent years. Certain property institutions may be better than others for justice. A system of markets and private property covering all or most of the resources in society will make it very difficult to ensure the steady application of principles like equality, distribution according to need, or even as some have argued—see, e.g., Hayek (1976)—distribution according to desert. Some have argued that property rights in a market economy ought to be treated as resistant to redistribution and perhaps as insensitive to distributive justice generally except possibly at the moment of their initial allocation (see Nozick 1974). If we take this view and if we also take distributive issues seriously, we may have to commit ourselves to a compromised or eclectic system rather than a pure market system of private property.

In contrast with Locke, Kant and Hegel, David Hume contended that there is nothing natural or native to us about private property. The “contrariety” of our passions and the “looseness and easy transition [of material objects] from one person to another” mean that any situation in which I hold or use a resource is always vulnerable to disruption (Hume 1739 [2007], SB 487, 489). Until possession is stabilized by social rules, there is no secure relation between person and thing. We may think that there ought to be: we may think, for example, that a person has a moral right to something that he has made and that society has an obligation to give legal backing to this moral right. But according to Hume, we have to ask what it is in general for society to set up and enforce rules of this kind, before we can reach any conclusions about the normative significance of the relation between any particular person and any particular thing.

Our property is nothing but those goods, whose constant possession is establish’d by the laws of society; that is, by the laws of justice. Those, therefore, who make use of the words property, or right, or obligation, before they have explain’d the origin of justice, or even make use of them in that explication, are guilty of a very gross fallacy, and can never reason upon any solid foundation. A man’s property is some object related to him. This relation is not natural, but moral, and founded on justice. Tis very preposterous, therefore, to imagine, that we can have any idea of property, without fully comprehending the nature of justice, and shewing its origin in the artifice and contrivance of man. The origin of justice explains that of property. The same artifice gives rise to both. (Hume 1739 [2007], SB 491)

The Humean view of property as a convention has been taken up by Murphy and Nagel (2002) as a basis for resisting the view, associated with Nozick 1974, that property rights can pose any moral obstacle to programs of tax and transfer or other forms of redistribution and social control. But the fact that something is conventional doesn’t mean it can safely be treated as malleable or as something that can be overridden without cost. There is always a further question about the moral reasons that there are for holding conventions steady; and these reasons may actually echo other themes in the property debate.

Before Hume, the view that the issue of property begged questions about the general basis of social organization was already foreshadowed in the political philosophy of Thomas Hobbes. Indeed Hobbes regarded property as the key to political philosophy: “[M]y first enquiry was to be from whence it proceeded, that any man should call any thing rather his Owne, th[a]n another mans” (Hobbes 1642/51: Epistle Dedicatory, para 9 [1983: 26–7]). For Hobbes, property rules were the product of authority—the acknowledged authority of a sovereign, whose commands could guarantee the peace and make it safe for men to embark on social and economic activities that outstripped their ability to protect themselves using their own individual strength. Hume, by contrast, was interested in the possibility that the relevant settlement might emerge as conventions from ordinary human interactions rather than as impositions by an acknowledged figure in authority (Hume 1739 [1978: 490]).[3]

Still even if we concede that property is the product of social rules, and that normative thinking about the former must be preceded by normative thinking about the latter, there might be facts about the human condition or our agency as embodied beings that provide philosophical premises for an argument that property relations should be established in one way rather than another. Clearly, there is at least one material object with which a person does seem to have an intimate pre-legal relation that would bear some philosophical analysis—namely, that person’s body. We are embodied beings and to a certain extent the use and control of our limbs, sensory organs etc. is indispensable for our agency. Were a person to be deprived of this control—were others to have the right to block or manipulate the movements of his physical body—then his agency would be truncated, and he would be incapable of using his powers of intention and action to make something he (and others) could regard as a life for himself. Some modern authors, following John Locke, have tried to think about this in terms of an idea of self-ownership. According to G.A. Cohen (1995) a person owns himself when he has all the control over his own body that a master would have over him were he a slave. Now since a master is entitled to make comprehensive use of his slave for his own profit without owing any account or any contribution to anyone else, it seems to follow from the idea of self-ownership that a person must be allowed to profit equally comprehensively from the control of his own mental and bodily resources. Taking his cue from Nozick (1974) that taxation on earnings is a form of coerced labor (for others or for the state), Cohen concludes that various egalitarian arrangements (like welfare paid for out of taxation) are incompatible with the self-ownership of the rich. It looks like we have to choose between principles of equality and principles of self-ownership. Debate on this issue continues (Otsuka 1998; Vrousalis 2011; Sobel 2012): some argue that what we owe to others must be figured out first before there can be any question of owning either our selves, our bodies, or other material resources; while others say that any attempt to make the argument in that order will lead to counter-intuitive results (Nozick 1974: 234). Some recent discussions have called into question the very idea of self-ownership (Harris 1996: 184–197; Lippert-Rasmussen 2008; Phillips 2013; Hacker 2010: 279–283), denying that this concept is necessary in order to capture the inviolability of the human person.

There is a further question whether self-ownership affords a basis for thinking about property in external objects other than my body? John Locke thought that it did (Locke 1689: II, para. 27). He suggested that when I work on an object or cultivate a piece of land, I project something of my self-owned self into the thing. That something I have worked on embodies a part of me is a common enough sentiment, but it is difficult to give it a analytically precise sense. That an object is shaped the way it is may be an effect of my actions; but actions don’t seem to have the trans-temporal endurance to enable us to say that they remain present in the object after the time of their performance. The idea of mixing one’s labor seems to be a piece of rhetoric which enhances other arguments for private property rather than an argument in its own right.

Others have speculated about an effect in the opposite direction—not so much the incorporation of the self into the object as the incorporation of the thing into the self (Radin 1982). As we have seen, something akin to this can be found in Hegel’s work, where he says (Hegel 1820 [1967], p 40, para. 41): ‘A person must translate his freedom into an external sphere in order to exist as Idea.’ In plain English, the taking of possession of property and acting upon it in various ways gave them the opportunity to make concrete the plans and schemes that would otherwise just buzz around inside their heads, and to take responsibility for their intentions as the material they were working on—a home or an sculptor’s block of marble—registered the impact of the decisions they had made, i.e. the ‘translation of their freedom’ into the external world (see Waldron 1988: 343–89). Even the utilitarian Jeremy Bentham toyed with a version this idea. Though property, he said, depended on positive law, the law of property had an effect on the self that makes redistribution particularly objectionable. Law provided security for our expectations, and when that security came to be focused on a particular object, that object formed part of the structure of one’s agency:

It is hence that we have the power of forming a general plan of conduct; it is hence that the successive instants which compose the duration of life are not like isolated and independent points, but become continuous parts of a whole. (Bentham 1802 [1931: 111])

4. Genealogies of Property

In our philosophical tradition, arguments about the justification of property have often been presented as genealogies: as stories about the way in which private property might have emerged in a world that was hitherto unacquainted with the institution.

The best known are Lockean stories (Locke 1689 and Nozick 1974). One begins with a description of a state of nature and an initial premise about land belonging to nobody in particular. And then one tells a story about why it would be sensible for individuals to appropriate land and other resources for their personal use and about the conditions under which such appropriations would be justified. Individuals have needs and they find themselves surrounded with objects capable of satisfying those needs. But each person, X, is vaguely aware that the objects have not been furnished by God or nature for X’s use alone; others have a need for them as well. So what is X to do? One thing is clear: if X has to wait for some general meeting of everyone who might be affected by his use of the resources in his vicinity before he is allowed to use them then, as Locke put it, “man had starved, notwithstanding the plenty God had given him” (Locke 1689: II, para. 28). So the individual goes ahead and takes what he needs (1689: I, para. 86). He “mixes his labor” with the object he needs, and by doing so he fulfills his fundamental duty of self-preservation, while also increasing the value of the resources he works on for the indirect benefit of others. The first phase of Locke’s story involves individuals satisfying their needs out of the common largesse in this virtuous and self-reliant way. The second phase of the story involves their exchanging surplus goods that they have appropriated with one another; rather than saying that such surpluses lapse back into the common heritage, Locke allows individuals to acquire, grow, or make more than they can use so that markets become possible and prosperity general (1689: II, paras. 46–51). With markets and prosperity, however, comes inequality, avarice and envy, and the third and last stage of Locke’s account is the institution of government to protect the property rights that have grown up in this way (1689: II, paras. 123 ff.) The story assumes that individuals are able to reason through these issues of who is entitled to appropriate and use and exchange goods without the tutelage of government, and that at neither the first stage nor the second stage is any social or political decision-making about property required.

In its most basic aspect, Locke’s genealogy has the character of a First Occupancy story. In the first instance, the legitimacy of an individual’s appropriation stems largely from the fact that it does not involve the direct expropriation of anyone else: by definition the “first occupancy” is peaceful. There are, of course, strong elements of utilitarian and virtue theory in Locke’s account too—the productivity of labor and the privileging of what Locke calls “the Industrious and the Rational” over the “Covetousness of the Quarrelsom and Contentious” (1689: II, para. 34). But the issue of historical priority is indispensable. Whose use of a given resource came first is crucial, and the order in which goods were subsequently transferred from hand to hand is indispensable for understanding the legitimacy of current entitlements. Robert Nozick (1974) has done more than anyone else to elucidate the form of this kind of “historical entitlement” theory.

Not all genealogies of property have this shape. David Hume tells a completely different sort of story. On his approach, we begin by assuming that since time immemorial, people have been fighting over resources, so that the distribution of de facto possession at any given time is arbitrary, being driven by force, cunning, and luck. Now it is possible that such fighting will continue indefinitely. But it is also possible that it may settle down into a sort of stable equilibrium in which those in possession of significant resources and those tempted to grab resources from others find that the marginal costs of further predatory activity are equal to their marginal gains. Under these conditions, something like a ‘peace dividend’ may be available. Maybe everyone can gain, in terms of the diminution of conflict, the stabilizing of social relations, and the prospects for market exchange, by an agreement not to fight any more over possessions.

I observe, that it will be for my interest to leave another in the possession of his goods, provided he will act in the same manner with regard to me. He is sensible of a like interest in the regulation of his conduct. When this common sense of interest is mutually express’d, and is known to both, it produces a suitable resolution and behaviour.… (Hume 1739 [1978: 490])

Such a resolution, if it lasts, may amount over time to a ratification of de facto holdings as de jure property. As with Locke’s account, the state comes into the picture much later to reinforce conventions of property that emerge informally in this way (Hume 1739 [1978: 534 ff.]). But notice how much more modest Hume’s story is than the Lockean account in the moral claims that it makes (see Waldron 1994). The stability of the emergent distribution has nothing to do with its justice, nor with the moral quality of the actions by which goods were appropriated. It may be fair or unfair, equal or unequal, but the parties already know that they cannot hope for a much better distribution by pitching their own strength yet again against that of others. (See also Buchanan 1975 for a modern version of this approach.)

As an account of the genesis of property, Hume’s theory has the advantage over its main rivals of acknowledging that the early eras of human history are eras of conflict largely unregulated by principle and opaque to later moral enquiry. It does not require us to delve into history to ascertain who did what to whom, and what would have happened if they had not. Once a settled pattern of possession emerges, we simply draw an arbitrary line and say, ‘Property entitlements start from here.’ The model has important normative consequences for the present as well. Those who are tempted to question or disrupt an existing distribution of property must recognize that far from ushering in a new era of justice, their best efforts are likely to inaugurate an era of conflict in which all bets are off and in which virtually no planning or cooperation is possible. The weakness of the Humean approach is the obverse of its strength. The moral considerations that it marginalizes actually do matter to us. For example, we would not be happy with a Humean convention ratifying slavery or cannibalism, but for all that Hume shows it may well be a feature of the equilibrium emerging from the age of conflict that some people are in possession of others’ bodies. The point is that even if Hume is right that the sentiment of justice is built up out of a convention to respect one another’s de facto possessions, that sentiment once established can take on a life of its own, so that it can subsequently be turned against the very equilibrium that engendered it (Waldron 1994).

A third variety of property-story makes the state and the social contract more fundamental than it is in either Locke’s or Hume’s approach. We are to imagine a period where people try and rely on their own physical and moral initiative to take possession of the resources which they need or want, but in which it become increasingly apparent that institution of reliable property arrangements is going to have to involve a social decision. Eventually property must be based on consent—the consent of everyone affected by decisions about the use and control of a given set of resources. This theory is associated with the normative political philosophy of Jean-Jacques Rousseau (1762) and Immanuel Kant (1797). As we have seen, the Lockean critique of this sort of approach was always that urgency of material need left no time for social consent. In fact the Rousseau/Kant approach has little difficulty with this point. There can be provisional appropriations made unilaterally (Ryan 1984: 80). But every such appropriation is subject in principle to the consent of all and must be offered up for social ratification. In other words, the urgency of immediate need is not taken as a basis of discrediting the review and redistribution of possession by society as a whole if serious distributive anomalies are emerging.

What all this actually yields in the way of a legitimate assignment of resources to individuals is a matter of the distributive principles that survive the test of ratification by the general will. Rawlsian, egalitarian and utilitarian approaches are all imaginable under the auspices of this account. The essence of the Rousseau/Kant approach is that society’s deployment of principles like these to evaluate existing distributions is never trumped by the history of entitlements and it is never excluded by the Humean conventions that may have emerged as a cosy equilibrium among those who are actually in possession.

What claims are being made in and about these stories? Are we to assume that one of them is literally true? Or what are we to infer from their falsity (if they are historically inaccurate)? Does it follow that property is illegitimate? A number of philosophers have suggested recently that a genealogy can make an important contribution to our understanding of a phenomenon even when it is not literally true: Bernard Williams (2002) has suggested this about language and the emergence of truth-telling, following Edward Craig (1999)’s genealogical account of our possession of the concept of knowledge. Robert Nozick has also discussed the value of what he calls “potential explanations”—stories that would explain how something happened if certain things were the case (some of which in fact are not the case):

To see how in principle, a whole realm could fundamentally be explained greatly increases our understanding of the realm…We learn much by seeing how the state could have arisen, even if it didn’t arise that way. (Nozick 1974: 8–9)

The genealogies we have considered may differ in this regard. The Rousseau/Kant approach helps us understand why private property is inherently a matter of social concern and the Humean approach helps us see the value of property in providing people with a fixed and mutually acknowledged basis on which the rest of social life can be built, whether or not it answers to our independent intuitions of justice. But the Lockean genealogy may explain little or nothing about property entitlements unless it is actually true. As Nozick acknowledges (1974: 151–2), a modern state should not feel morally constrained by property holdings which might have had a Lockean pedigree but in fact do not. In this regard it is interesting that one of the main uses of Lockean theory these days is in defending the property rights of indigenous people—where a literal claim is being made about who had first possession of a set of resources and about the need to rectify the injustices that accompanied their subsequent expropriation (see Waldron 1992).

A last genealogical account is centred around the primacy of use rights. It seems common ground that persons cannot rightly be denied the right to make use of the resources of the earth without the constant interference of others. At a bare minimum, then, individuals are justifiably held to have use rights in the material resources of the earth. Use rights (aka ‘usufructory rights’) can be variously described (Westphal 1997: 151–151; Westphal 2016: 146–149; Penner 2020: 177–180) but the basic features of a use right are these: (1) it is limited by the actual uses a person is making of some thing; (2) it is limited in time, i.e., lasts only so long as the person is using it; (3) there is no right of transfer of the thing; (4) it is in principle non-exclusive. A second or third or nth person can make use of a thing so long as no prior use is interfered with. Use-rights align in certain respects with Katz’s (2008) characterisation of the owner as ‘agenda setter’. The first user sets the agenda for the thing, by making uses by others which are incompatible with her use off-limits. But another person is not disentitled from using the thing so long as his use does not interfere with the first user’s use. So, for example, a person does no wrong by crossing through the first user’s orchard so long as he does not damage the fruit trees or in any other way interfere with the first owner’s use of the land as an orchard. However attractive this picture is, there is a compelling pragmatic or instrumental reason to replace a system of use rights with a system of fully exclusive property rights: a system of use rights is extremely epistemically demanding, whilst a system of property rights is not (Smith 2012: 1702–1705; Ripstein 2013). A person typically cannot tell what the first user’s ‘agenda’ for a thing is just by looking at it. Knowing whether one’s intended use interferes with the first user’s will typically involve a significant inquiry. By contrast, the rule against trespassing under a property rights system is a bright line rule: if it is not yours, ‘keep off’. This rule is epistemically very undemanding: the knowledge it requires is of two kinds: (1) autobiographical (which things have come to be yours) and (2) what sorts of things are private property as opposed to common property (e.g., your shoes as opposed to public roads, parks, and so on), knowledge which is also easily acquired. Where an owner no longer has a use for something she can transfer it to another by way of gift or in exchange. Property rights on this account are instituted to protect use-rights in the most efficient way possible, but at a cost: uses which would not interfere with a first user’s agenda are ruled out along with the ones which would.

Finally, we should not forget that not all genealogies set out to flatter the practices or institutions they purport to explain. Karl Marx’s account of primitive accumulation (1867) and Jean-Jacques Rousseau’s non-normative description of the invention of property in the Discourse on the Origins of Inequality (Rousseau 1755) are genealogies written more in a Nietzschean spirit of pathology than as part of any quest for justification. Such negative genealogies reminds us of the importance of Mill’s observation that in approaching the justification of private property we must remember that, “we must leave out of consideration its actual origin in any of the existing nations of Europe” (Mill 1848: bk II, ch 1, §1 [1994: 7]).

5. Property and Distributive Justice

Two questions must be distinguished, which might be illustrated by a pair of examples. Consider a society in which nobles are allowed to own slaves, but commoners are not. Consider also a society in which men may vote in Parliamentary elections, but women may not. Assume in both cases that the restrictive allocation of these rights is arbitrary and irrational. So these cases are ones of distributive injustice. How might we deal with this problem? One solution is to abolish the right entirely, so no one has it—no distribution, no distributive injustice. We take it our readers will agree that this is the correct solution in the slavery case, but not the voting case. The right to own slaves is not a good right to have, but the right to vote is. The point is that we must value the right positively or negatively before dealing with any issues arising from its distribution. Assuming that one of the justificatory stories in Parts 3 and 4 works, so that one may conclude that a property right is a good right to have, we can move to the second question. In doing so we have to consider the various modes of distribution that operate on property rights. It is beyond the scope of this entry to discuss the justification of these modes in detail, but the parenthetical references provide a good starting point for inquiry: These modes are:

Original or first appropriation. As a practical matter, original appropriation is a very minor source of property rights these days (deep sea fishing is probably the only major example). Even so, as we saw in Part 4, original appropriation remains of significant theoretical interest. (Sreenivasan 1995; Sage 2012, 2018; Otsuka 2018; Penner 2018)

Government transfer payments, such as welfare benefits, unemployment insurance payments, state pension payments. States may also expropriate and confiscate property, and award damages in private legal actions, institute insolvency procedures, but these are not a major factor in the distribution of property, although these modes obviously raise justice concerns of one kind or another. As to government transfers, the discourse has largely centred aound the legitimacy of taxation for ‘redistributive’ purposes. (See, e.g., Rawls 1999: ch V, Nozick 1974: ch 7, Bhandari 2017)

Inter vivos gifts, inheritance, and bequest. Inheritance must be distinguished from bequest. Inheritance is a regime of succession to property under which the descendants of a person have an indefeasible right to his or her property on death. Civilian and Islamic legal regimes of succession are regimes of this kind. Under these regimes there is no, or very limited, freedom of testamentary disposition. In contrast, bequests concern postmortem gifts. These can of course be made to one’s descendants and other dependents, but typically in these regimes testators (the donors of postmortem gifts) have unrestricted freedom of testamentary disposition. Though people tend still to use the word “heir” in England and other common law jurisdictions, typically there are no longer, properly speaking, heirs in these countries. (Beckert 2004 [2008]; Penner 2014; Schmidt am Busch et al 2023.)

Contract. Markets are made up of all the contracts persons enter into to exchange goods and services. Markets, and their constitutive contracts, are more or less regulated by law, as with consumer protection legislation. (Baldwin 1959; Kronman 1980; Gordley 1981, 1991; Buckle 1991; Bar-Gill 2012; Klass et al 2014; Jiménez 2021).

This mode of distribution is the one which has attracted the most controversy, and it is right to point out that many of the alleged market-advantages accrue only if private property is distributed in certain ways. Monopolistic control of the main factors of production by a few individuals or corporations can play havoc with market efficiency, and it can also lead to such great concentrations of private power as to offset any argument for property based on freedom, dissent, or democracy. Distributive equity may be crucial also for nonconsequentialist arguments. The idea that property-owning promotes virtue is, as we have seen, as old as Aristotle, and even today it is used by civic republicans as an argument against economic collectivism. According to this argument, if most economic resources are owned in common or controlled collectively for everyone’s benefit, there is no guarantee that citizen’s conditions of life will be such as to promote republican virtue. In a communist or collectivist society, citizens may behave either as passive beneficiaries of the state or irresponsible participants in a tragedy of the commons. If a generation or two grow up with that character then the integrity of the whole society is in danger. These arguments are interesting, but it is worth noting how sensitive they are to the distribution of property (Waldron 1988: 323–42). As T.H. Green observed, a person who owns nothing in a capitalist society “might as well, in respect of the ethical purposes which the possession of property should serve, be denied rights of property altogether” (Green 1886/1895: §220 [1895: 219]).

There is a final question that must be asked: even if the various modes of distribution do give rise to various distributive injustices, might not it be better overall not to disturb these modes because doing so would diminish other gains they might realise? It is beyond the scope of this entry to consider claims of this sort in detail, but the following may be said.

It is surely important to keep in view the ‘big picture’ that a system of property presents (Singer 2000 and Purdy 2010). What overall model of community is generated by a given system of property rights and by the way they circulate in society? What kinds of inter-personal relations does a given system of property foster? What ethos of economic interaction does it give rise to: an obsession with efficiency, an ethic of competitiveness, or a shared concern for those who are less well-off? These questions are not distinct from questions about distribution, but they look at them in a different light, not just asking about their moral justification one by one.

Second, one should consider an argument about desert in order to show that there is justice in some people’s enjoying the fruits of private property even while others languish in poverty. If private property involves the wiser and more efficient use of resources, it is because someone has exercised virtues of prudence, industry, and self-restraint. People who languish in poverty, on this account, do so largely because of their idleness, profligacy, or want of initiative. Now, theories like this are easily discredited if they purport to justify the actual distribution of wealth under an existing private property economy (Nozick 1974: 158–9; Hayek 1976). But there is a more modest position which desert theorists can adopt: namely, that private property alone offers a system in which idleness is not rewarded at the expense of industry, a system in which those who take on the burdens of prudence and productivity can expect to reap some reward for their virtue which distinguishes them from those who did not make any such effort (Munzer 1990: 285 ff.).

Third, we must also consider justificatory arguments that connect property with liberty. Societies with private property are often described as free societies. Part of what this means is surely that owners are free to use their property as they please; they are not bound by social or political decisions. (And correlatively, the role of government in economic decision-making is minimized.) But that cannot be all that is meant, for it would be equally apposite to describe private property as a system of unfreedom, since it necessarily involves the social exclusion of people from resources that others own. All property systems distribute freedoms and unfreedoms; no system of property can be described without qualification as a system of liberty. Someone may respond that the liberty to use what belongs to another is license not liberty, and so its exclusion should not really count against a private property system in the libertarian calculus. But the price of this maneuver is very high: not only does it commit the libertarian to a moralized conception of freedom of the sort that he usually shies away from (as in case of positive liberty), but it also means that liberty, so defined, can no longer be invoked to support property except in a question-begging way (Cohen 1979).

Two other things might be implied by the libertarian characterization. The first is a point about independence: a person who owns a significant amount of private property—a home, say, and a source of income—has less to fear from the opinion and coercion of others than the citizen of a society in which some other form of property predominates. The former inhabits, in a fairly literal sense, the ‘private sphere’ that liberals have always treasured for individuals—a realm of action in which he need answer to no-one but himself. But like the virtue argument, this version of the libertarian case is also sensitive to distribution: for those who own nothing in a private property economy would seem to be as unfree—by this argument—as anyone would be in a socialist society.

That last point may be too quick, however, for there are other indirect ways in which private property contributes to freedom (Purdy 2005). Milton Friedman (1962) argues that political liberty is enhanced in a society where the means of intellectual and political production (printing presses, photocopying machines, computers) are controlled by a number of private individuals, firms, and corporations—even if that number is not very large. In a capitalist society, a dissident has the choice of dealing with several people (other than state officials) if he wants to get his message across, and many of them are prepared to make their media available simply on the basis of money, without regard to the message. In a socialist society, by contrast, those who are politically active either have to persuade state agencies to disseminate their views, or risk underground publication. More generally, Friedman argues, a private property society offers those who own nothing a greater variety of ways in which they earn a living—a larger menu of masters, if you like—than they would be offered in a socialist society. In these ways, private property for some may make a positive contribution to freedom—or at least an enhancement of choice—for everyone.

Finally, in this review of direct normative arguments about property, we should consider the moral importance property might have in respect of what it is, rather than what it does or brings about. Property rights in and of themselves give people a certain status and recognition in society: a property owner is respected in his or her control of a resource (Dorfman 2012). This is surely important; it was, as we saw, one of the themes of the approach taken in Hegel 1820 and in Kant 1797 (see Byrd & Hruschka 2006). But it can have critical implications for property too, for if property is unevenly distributed, if inequality is radical and some are more or less comprehensively bereft of property rights, then acute issues have to be faced about the uneven distribution of the bases of respect. We cannot take seriously the good that property rights do in regard to moral recognition without also considering the inherent harm of absence of such recognition in the case of those who own nothing.

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As of the 2026 update, James Penner has taken responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry.

Copyright © 2026 by
Jeremy Waldron
James Penner <lawjep@nus.edu.sg>

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