1. Broad (1923, 240) used instead the term “sensa” (singular “sensum”).

2. Firth (1949–50 [1976, 220]) suggests that, prior to Price, sense-data theorists agreed with Locke and Berkeley in positing flat or planar sense data (Firth has vision in mind). See Section 2.1.1 for an exception in Descartes. Note that, after Price, the assumption that sense data are two dimensional remained common.

3. There is lively discussion on the extent to which the notion of sensory impression or bare sensation is present in various ancient and medieval authors. Hamlyn (1961, 28) finds that Aristotle “was on the verge” of distinguishing sensation from perception. Bynum (1987, secs. 4, 8, 9) accepts a standard view on which Aristotle distinguishes between what is passively received by the senses (the proper objects, such as color or sound) and subsequent acts of judgment and interpretation by the common sense and phantasia, which yield perceptions of objects. Løkke (2008) examines the Stoic distinction between passively received sense impressions and further perceptual cognitive acts that yield perception of objects and conceptual knowledge. Robinson (1994, ch. 1.2) finds a dominant theme in ancient and medieval theories of perception to be the distinction between a passively received sense impression and an active, perhaps interpretive, response. Pasnau (1997) and Adriaenssen (2017) argue that a “veil of species” problem arose in medieval philosophy, with authors such as Thomas Aquinas being accused by subsequent theorists of abetting skepticism about our knowledge of the external world by making “sensible species” the immediate objects of perception (even though that position was rejected by Aquinas). Pasnau (1997, ch. 3.1) suggests that William Crathorn posited intervening species that manifest natural instances of red in the case of our seeing a red thing, so that the intervening medium and the eye actually turn red (consonant with item 3 of the Classical Notion). By contrast, most adherents of species theories held that red-species have a diminished existence in the medium, eyes, and sensory nerves, which receive them without turning red, but nonetheless yield a perception of red.

4. Lewis (1929), for example, while rejecting traditional sense data (1929, 61), attributes to sensory experience two elements, sensuous and conceptual:

There are, in our cognitive experience, two elements: the immediate data, such as those of sense, which are presented or given to the mind, and a form, construction, or interpretation, which represents the activity of thought. Recognition of this fact is one of the oldest and most universal of philosophic insights. (1929, 38)

5. Firth (1949–50 [1976, 215–216]) finds that Locke and Berkeley posited sense data. Mundle (1971, 27, 38–44, 64–67, 72) ascribes the concept of sense data to Descartes, Locke, Berkeley, and Hume. Yolton (1996, 26–27) notes that these authors have been read as predicating sensory qualities “of the mind”, which matches his conception of what “sense-datum philosophers” maintain. Yolton resists this reading (although he finds the position in Hume’s philosophical persona, but not his common-sense persona: 1996, 134). Robinson (1994, ch. 1.4) describes Locke, Berkeley, and Hume as sense-data theorists.

6. The question is debated of whether early moderns such as Descartes and Locke held that sensory ideas are the direct object of perception (a version of item 1) to the exclusion of direct perception of external objects. Adriaenssen (2017, ch. 4.1) describes contrasting interpretations in which Descartes does or does not make ideas the exclusive object of sense perception, siding with the latter. He interprets passages about immediate awareness as describing an immediate awareness of the very ideas that are direct perceptions of external objects. Rogers (2004) offers a reading of Locke as a direct realist. In contrast, Newman (2009) argues that both Descartes and Locke adhere to indirect accounts of the perception of external objects.

7. On the contemporary notion of intentionality, which is related to Descartes’ notion, see Jacob (2003 [2019], sec. 10). The notion of intentional content can include nonconceptual content, which might present objects as being a certain way without affirming that they are as they appear.

8. An adherent of the view that Berkeley attributes red as a property to ideas might argue that this passage only indicates that the mind is not extended and colored, not that ideas are not extended and colored. The point is made difficult because Berkeley never fully articulates his notion of an idea, so that when he says that “qualities are in the mind ... by way of idea”, we cannot turn to his theory of ideas for help. In the present entry, Berkeley is taken to treat ideas and sensations as presenting appearances by way of intentional content, so that item 3 is not ascribed to Berkeley.

9. Berkeley, discussing the variability of sensory ideas, notes that perceptions of heat and cold, or figure and extension, vary with the state and spatial position of the observer, from which he concludes (by Variation) that such perceptions exist only in the mind. But he observed that, in fact, “this method of arguing doth not so much prove that there is no extension or colour in an outward object as that we do not know which is the true extension or color” (Principles, pt 1, art. 15; see also Three Dialogues, First Dialogue [2008, 188]). Hume defended Variation at Treatise, I.4.4.4, by arguing that if some impressions present external things directly and others through a mental variant, there should be a phenomenal difference between the different types of perception; there being none, if some instances of sensory qualities are in the mind, all of those that are phenomenally similar should be as well. A related argument is found in Price (Sec. 2.2.3, below).

10. In affirming a material entity (the retinal image) as the perceptual datum, Hamilton accepted that perception of the distant material object requires a further psychological act, in this sense endorsing the spirit of item 5. But the retinal image, as a physical pattern of light, is not private, conflicting with item 7.

11. Scattered uses of the term had occurred in British and American philosophy, e.g., Sidgwick 1883 and James 1887; see Hatfield 2013a, 951–952.

12. The next three sections use research reported in Hatfield 2013a and 2013b.

13. Moore introduced the concept of sense data without the term in “The Nature and Reality of Objects of Perception” (1905–06). The paper offers a minimum characterization of what is “actually observed” or “directly perceived” in experience, which includes color patches and their spatial relations (1905–06, 101).

14. It differs from standard representative realism in not regarding the representing datum as mental.

15. In offering a fuller account of physical theory in the Analysis of Matter, Russell did not alter his basic position (1927, 10, 382), but he provided a finer-grained analysis of the unsensed momentary particulars that occupy places without perceivers. These momentary particulars, whose intrinsic properties are discerned through analogy with perceived momentary particulars, are projected to exhibit structures as described in physical theory—the hypothetical entities of physics, such as electrons, being constructions from these particulars together with the sensed ones (1927, 227, 271, ch. 38). For additional discussion and references, see Banks 2014 (ch. 4).

16. Price (1932, 218–220) holds that many visual sense data are three dimensional and he endorses size and shape constancy for objects near at hand, out to a “few feet”.

17. In his statement of the argument, Price (1932, 32) refers to a cricket ball; I’ve altered it to the more familiar soccer ball.

18. Price (1932: 30–32) also offers a simpler version of the argument (without continuity), which moves from premise 4 to the assertion that non-illusory experiences, as perceptual experiences, do not differ phenomenally from illusory experiences, and then uses 9 and 10 to reach 11. This simpler formulation is closer to Hume’s version of Variation (see note 9).

19. On the place of sense data in epistemology with attention to implications from psychology see Firth (1949–50). Robinson (1994) also offers an historical overview.

20. Robinson (1994, 32) has labelled this the “Phenomenal Principle”, which he states as follows:

If there sensibly appears to a subject to be something which possesses a particular sensible quality then there is something of which the subject is aware which does possess that sensible quality,

and ultimately endorses (1994, ch. 7; further elaboration in 2022, 33–34).

21. Firth (1949–50 [1976, 219–222]) groups James and the Gestalt psychologists with the American philosopher John Dewey as upholders of a “percept theory”, according to which perceptual consciousness is unified in its awareness of an external object, rejecting on phenomenal grounds the splitting of sensory consciousness into sense data and material objects.

22. Note that in his investigation of the composite nature of white light, Newton was guided by the perceived qualities of light (red, yellow, etc.). Having separated white light into homogeneal lights of various colors, he posited light rays differing in color and refractive properties (Newton 1718, bk I, pt I, def. 8; prop. 2). As he explained, the rays themselves were not colored but are called “red-making” (etc.) because of the color experiences they caused in observers (1718, bk I, pt II, prop. 2, Definition). Observations based on those experiences supported his findings about the relations between colors and refractions; he had no access to spectrophotometers or the like.

23. Jackson 1977 (ch. 4) seeks to undermine appearance theories. If that argument were successful, it would block the particular criticism of Jackson’s sense-data theory noted here.

24. Empirical support for Price’s claim for shape can be found in Howard et al. (2014), and, more generally, for size constancy, in Granrud (2012) and Hatfield (2016). Nonetheless, the interpretation of phenomenal and cognitive factors in reports of shape and size constancy remains contested (see Wagner 2012).