A. Dynamic Loci

In spoken language, quantifiers with existential force sometimes seem to bind variables that are not in their syntactic scope, as in the example mentioned above: A woman will go to Mars. She will be famous. Geach (1962) discussed the same problem within the confines of a single sentence, as in: If a farmer owns a donkey, he beats it. Similar cases arise in sign languages; indeed, we saw examples of the same form pertaining to reference to temporal and to modal situations in Section 1.2. These sentences have led to a foundational debate: Is the notion of scope inherited from standard logic (called ‘c-command’ in linguistics) sufficient to analyze these phenomena, or does one need a ‘dynamic logic’ that is in some respects more liberal? There are thus two main views, and here too sign language loci have provided new insights (see the entry on anaphora).

According to Dynamic Semantics, the logical system underlying natural languages is different from that of standard logic. Dynamic semantics develops rules that make it possible for a variable or a pronoun to depend on an existential quantifier or an indefinite without being within its scope (i.e., without being c-commanded by it; see the entry on dynamic semantics).

According to E-type analyses, no new logical system is needed for natural language because the assimilation of pronouns to variables is incorrect. On this view, the pronoun she in the above discourse (A woman will go to Mars. She will be famous) is in fact a concealed description such as the woman, or the woman who will go to Mars (e.g., Evans 1980; Heim 1990; Elbourne 2005). Analyses that make this assumption are called ‘E-type’.

E-type theories encounter an independent problem, pertaining to the existence of a formal link between the pronoun and its antecedent. Despite the near-synonymy between the if-clauses in (A1a) and (A1b), only the first licenses anaphora. Elbourne (2005) develops a particularly elegant version of the E-type theory which solves this problem; for him, the descriptive content of an E-type pronoun is literally obtained by a process of nominal ellipsis. The contrast between (A1a) and (A1b) arises simply because the missing nominal can be found in a wife but not in married, as sketched in (35c).

(A1)

a.

If Maurice Ravel had had a wife, she would have enjoyed his music.

b.

??If Marice Ravel had been married, she would have enjoyed his music.

c.

If Maurice Ravel had had a wife, she wife would have enjoyed his music.

A natural assumption one could make about sign language is that this formal link is instantiated by locus assignment: a pointing sign towards a locus introduced by a certain nominal recovers the latter by way of ellipsis resolution.

This hypothesis, however, runs into problems involving so called ‘bishop’ sentences (so named because original examples involved bishops). In these sentences, two potential antecedents are described with exactly symmetric semantic properties, as in (A2a) ((A2ab) makes the same point in a case in which, in addition, the two antecedents bear the same thematic role). On the E-type theory for sign language described above, the only contribution of pointing to a locus is to identify the NP material of the elided definite description. Counterintuitively, a version of this theory predicts that pointing to the locus corresponding to one individual can retrieve an individual corresponding to a different locus as long as the two were described symmetrically. An equally counterintuitive corollary is the prediction that pointing to the same locus twice in these cases should allow an interpretation where the two pronouns receive different meanings. But this is not possible: pointing twice to the same locus (twice to IX-a or twice to IX-b) yields the wrong reading, one on which a given Frenchman wonders who he himself lives with.

(A2)

a.

WHEN [FRENCH MAN]_a a,b-MEET [FRENCH MAN]_b, IX-a WONDER WHO IX-b LIVE WITH.
‘When a Frenchman meets a Frenchman, the former wonders who the latter lives with.’
(ASL, i P1040945)

b.

WHEN SOMEONE_a AND SOMEONE_b LIVE TOGETHER, IX-a LOVE IX-b.
‘When someone and someone live together, the former loves the latter.’
(ASL, P1040966)

Stepping back, while the sign language data do not fully decide the debate between dynamic analyses and E-type analyses, they arguably favor the former, as they provide overt motivation for its main ingredients. In these examples, a sign language locus appears to play very much the role of a variable, which is carried by a pronoun and by the antecedent it is anaphoric to. The connection between a pronoun and its antecedent as instantiated by loci is not constrained by c-command, a key claim of dynamic semantics. And this relation has a semantic reflex, in the sense that different denotations are obtained for a pronoun depending on which locus or variable it is associated with.