Content Externalism and Skepticism

First published Tue Mar 18, 2025

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Gary Ebbs replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Content externalism (CE) is roughly the thesis that the contents of a person’s thoughts are partly determined by facts about the person’s social or physical environment. Although the central arguments for CE presuppose our ordinary, non-skeptical beliefs, CE itself implies that we can each describe subjectively equivalent worlds in which we would receive the same sensory stimulations that we receive in the actual world, but the contents of our thoughts differ from the contents of our thoughts in the actual world. If we accept CE and ask how we know the contents of our own thoughts, we therefore face the following dilemma. Either:

First horn. We cannot know the contents of our own thoughts in the actual world without empirical investigation, since (a) we do not know without empirical investigation which of our subjectively equivalent worlds we are in, and (b) the contents of our thoughts are not the same in all our subjectively equivalent worlds; or

Second horn. We can know the contents of our own thoughts in the actual world without empirical investigation and from this knowledge we can deduce that we are not in any subjectively equivalent world in which the contents of our thoughts differ from the contents of our thoughts in the actual world.

The first horn conflicts with our ordinary assumption that we can know the contents of our own thoughts without empirical investigation. The second horn conflicts with the Cartesian skeptical intuition that we may actually be in any one of our subjectively equivalent worlds. Philosophers who accept CE typically reject the first horn by applying one of the strategies explained in the entry on externalism and self-knowledge. The present entry grants that one of these strategies is successful and focuses on the second horn. This horn forces us to confront the central question about CE and skepticism, namely,

(Q)
Is the Cartesian skeptical intuition that we may actually be in any one of our subjectively equivalent worlds compatible with CE despite appearances to the contrary, or, if not, are there reformulations of the intuition that are compatible with CE and enable us to formulate challenging Cartesian skeptical arguments?

There are two main streams of literature about the second horn that aim to clarify or answer (Q), one that begins with Michael McKinsey’s paper “Anti-Individualism and Privileged Access” (McKinsey 1991) and another that begins with Hilary Putnam’s chapter “Brains in a Vat” (Putnam 1981). This entry surveys the literature in these two streams in sections 6 and 7, after explaining key concepts, definitions, and arguments that one needs to know to understand this literature, namely, Cartesian arguments and hypotheses (section 1), Cartesian assumptions about epistemic possibility and thought content (section 2), CE and its varieties (section 3), CE and epistemic possibility (section 4), and the central dilemma for CE in skeptical contexts (section 5).

1. Cartesian skeptical arguments and hypotheses

It’s sunny today, or so I believe, as I look out the window. But could I be dreaming? And if so, do I know that it’s sunny today? According to a standard formulation of an argument in Descartes, Meditation One (paragraph 5), for any statement \(p\) about the world around me that I believe, such as it’s sunny today, I should reason as follows:

(1)
If I know that \(p\), then I know that I am not dreaming that \(p\).
(2)
I do not know that I am not dreaming that \(p\).
(3)
Therefore, I do not know that \(p\).

This is a paradigm example of a Cartesian skeptical argument. If it is sound, it shows that we do not know any of the things we ordinarily take ourselves to know about the world around us.

Argument (1)–(3) is valid and most of us find premise (1) compelling. Premise (2) appears compelling if one also accepts Dream:

Dream. Anything that can be going on or that one can experience in one’s waking life can also be dreamt about. (Stroud 1984: 18)

For Dream appears to imply that no matter how vivid my experience as of being awake may be, I cannot know that I am not dreaming. Argument (1)–(3) therefore appears to be sound.

Against Dream one might argue that dreams are not as vivid or coherent as waking experiences (Austin 1946, Leite 2011, Maddy 2017) or that “an interpretation of dreams presupposes thoughts in a wakeful state” (Burge 1986a, p. 120, Bouswma 1949). To avoid such concerns, one might replace “I am dreaming” in argument (1)–(3) with “an evil demon is deceiving me” (Descartes, Meditation One, last paragraph). But the hypothesis that an evil demon is deceiving me attributes mysterious, unexplained powers to the supposed evil demon. Perhaps for these reasons, the skeptical hypotheses most widely used today are variations on the idea that I am a bodiless brain in a vat whose neuro-chemical receptors are stimulated by a super-computer in the same way that the neuro-chemical receptors of an ordinary embodied brain are stimulated.

Suppose \(p\) is a statement about the world around me that I believe. Then a skeptical hypothesis H, such as I am dreaming, an evil demon is deceiving me, and I am a bodiless brain in vat, is a Cartesian skeptical hypothesis only if

(C1)
The fact that I believe that \(p\) is compatible with H.
(C2)
If H then I do not know that \(p\).

For any statement \(p\) about the world around me that I believe and every hypothesis H that satisfies (C1) and (C2) for my belief that \(p\), there is a corresponding Cartesian skeptical argument of the form:

If I know that \(p\), then I know that not H.
I do not know that not H.
Therefore, I do not know that \(p\).

Arguments of this form are designed “to convince us, on the basis of assumptions we ourselves hold, that all or a large part of our claims about the empirical world cannot amount to knowledge” (Putnam 1994: 284).

2. Cartesian assumptions: epistemic possibility and thought content

To construct a Cartesian skeptical argument one needs to formulate a skeptical hypothesis H that satisfies (C1) and (C2) for all or a very large number of statements about the empirical world that one believes. A hypothesis H satisfies constraint (C1) for an empirical statement \(p\) that I believe only if

(M)
The content of my belief that \(p\) would be the same whether or not H.

It may seem easy to construct Cartesian hypotheses that satisfy (M) for any statement about the empirical world that one believes. For when one imagines a situation in which one’s sensory surfaces would be affected in the same way they are in the actual world but one’s actual beliefs would be radically mistaken, as in a standard Cartesian brain-in-a-vat hypothesis, it is tempting to infer that in the imagined situation one’s belief contents would be the same as one’s belief contents in the actual world (Blackburn 1984: 312; Searle 1983: 230). CE implies that such inferences may lead to false conclusions: our belief contents are not guaranteed to be the same in every environment in which our sensory surfaces are affected in the same as they are in the actual world (Burge 1986a: 123). CE therefore implies that some traditional efforts to formulate skeptical hypotheses fail to satisfy (M) and hence also fail to satisfy (C1) (Falvey & Owens 1994: 121).

This observation sets part of the framework for debates in the literature about whether CE is compatible with the Cartesian skeptical intuition that we may actually be in any one of our subjectively equivalent worlds. The debates take for granted that “conceptualization on any considerable scale is inseparable from language” (Quine 1960: 3). They also assume that arguments for semantic externalism (SE)—roughly the thesis that the referents and satisfaction conditions of a person’s words and the associated truth conditions of the person’s utterances are partly determined by facts about the person’s social or physical environments—are a basis for, though distinct from, arguments for CE. The details of the debates depend on which varieties of SE and CE are under discussion. The next section presents the standard definitions of SE and CE and summarizes the varieties of SE and CE whose consequences for skepticism are the topic of sections 6 and 7 of this entry.

3. Semantic externalism and content externalism

3.1 Preliminary definitions

Semantic externalism (SE) and content externalism (CE) are defined in terms of “narrow” psychological states, namely, the physiological and functional states and processes of a person’s brain and/or body that can be described without using any semantical terms, without specifying the contents expressed by the states, and without mentioning any conditions beyond the person’s bodily surfaces (Putnam 1975a; Burge 1979, 1986a; Farkas 2006; Haukioja 2017):

Semantic Internalism (aka semantic individualism): The referents and satisfaction conditions of a person’s words and the associated truth conditions of the person’s utterances are entirely determined by (supervene on) the person’s narrow psychological states.

Content Internalism (aka content individualism): The contents of a person’s beliefs and other mental attitudes—the mental states we describe by using sentences containing “that”-clauses, such as “Alex believes that water is wet”— are entirely determined by (supervene on) the person’s narrow psychological states.

Semantic Externalism (aka semantic anti-individualism) is the negation of semantic internalism: The referents and satisfaction conditions of a person’s words and the associated truth conditions of the person’s utterances are not entirely determined by (do not supervene on) the person’s narrow psychological states.

Content Externalism (aka content anti-individualism) is the negation of content internalism: The contents of a person’s beliefs and other mental attitudes are not entirely determined by (do not supervene on) the person’s narrow psychological states.

Theories of SE and CE also imply that the semantics of our words and the contents of our thoughts depend on our environment. The several varieties of SE and CE that have been influential in the literature fall into two main groups: singular SE and CE, and general SE and CE.

3.2 Singular semantic and content externalism

Singular semantic externalism: The referents of a person’s singular terms, including proper names, such as “Aristotle,” demonstratives, such as “this” and “that,” and indexicals, such as “now” and “I,” are partly determined by causal relations that the person bears to particular objects in the person’s environment or to other speakers who are causally related to particular objects in the person’s environment.

According to direct reference theories, the semantical role of a proper name in a sentence, such as “Aristotle was fond of dogs,” is to supply an object, such as Aristotle, as a constituent of the content expressed by the sentence (Kripke 1980), and the semantic role of a demonstrative, such as “that,” as it occurs in a speaker’s utterance of a sentence, such as “That is a cat,” when the utterance is supplemented by the speaker’s appropriate and successful demonstration of a nearby object o, such as a cat, and is to supply o as a constituent of the content expressed by the utterance (Kaplan 1989: 500).

Singular content externalism: A person’s singular thought contents are partly individuated by objects in the actual environment beyond the person’s narrow mental states.

Kripke 1979 presents a puzzle about how direct reference theories are related to singular CE. Perry 1979 and Salmon 1986 posit psychological analogs of Fregean senses to try to solve the puzzle.

Singular CE implies that a speaker who utters a sentence containing a singular term on a given occasion may be confident that the singular term, as the speaker uses it on that occasion, has a referent, when in fact it does not. Such cases engender illusions of singular external thought content.

3.3 General semantic and content externalisms

3.3.1 General semantic externalisms

General semantic externalism: The referents and satisfaction conditions of a person’s non-singular terms, especially the person’s general terms, such as “elm,” are partly determined by (or supervene on) causal relations that the person bears to objects and/or other speakers in the person’s physical and social environments.

Singular SE and general SE are often combined, but they are logically independent.

Arguments for general semantic externalism

Kripke supports general SE by proposing that we view natural kind terms, such as “gold,” as singular terms that refer to substances. He theorizes that the referents of such singular terms of substances and the referents of ordinary proper names are fixed in similar ways:

In the case of proper names, the reference can be fixed in various ways. In an initial baptism it is typically fixed by an ostension or a description. Otherwise, the reference is usually determined by a chain, passing the name from link to link. The same observations hold for such a general term as “gold”. If we imagine a hypothetical (admittedly somewhat artificial) baptism of the substance, we must imagine it picked out by some such “definition” as, “Gold is the substance instantiated by the items over there, or at any rate, by almost all of them”. (Kripke 1980: 135)

On this version of general SE, satisfaction conditions for the predicate “is gold” must be defined in terms of the substance gold, roughly as follows: “is gold” is satisfied by an object x if and only if x is an instance of gold (Soames 2005: 58).

Putnam describes ostensive definitions of kind terms such as “water” without referring to a substance, as follows:

Suppose I point to a glass of water and say “this liquid is called water”…. My “ostensive definition” of water has the following empirical presupposition: that the body of liquid I am pointing to bears a certain sameness relation (say, x is the same liquid as y, or x is the sameL as y) to most of the stuff I and other speakers in my linguistic community have on other occasions called “water”. (Putnam 1975a: 225)

On this version of general SE, “‘water’ refers to water” is short for “x satisfies ‘is water’ if and only if x is water” (Putnam 1976b: 190). The sense in which the kind term “water” rigidly refers to water, is that

(For every world W) (for every x in W) (x is water if and only if x bears sameL to the entity referred to as ‘this’ in the actual world W1) (Putnam 1975a: 231)

Kripke and Putnam argue that if water is H2O, as we believe, then in any possible world in which there is water, it is H2O. (As Putnam later notes, “Normal water is actually a quantum mechanical superposition of H2O, H4O2, H6O3 … Very little (if any) water is simply H2O” (Putnam 2013: 198n10). To save words below, I’ll use “H2O” to denote these quantum states.)

Kripke and Putnam both emphasize, in effect, that speakers of the same natural language typically take one another’s words at face value and evaluate their utterances accordingly, even when they know very little about the topics their utterances concern. Putnam devised his method of constructing Twin Earth thought experiments to highlight the semantic consequences of accepting this observation about our ordinary linguistic practices. In his best-known Twin Earth thought experiment (Putnam 1975a: 223–225), Putnam imagines Oscar, who (a) lives on Earth and (b) does not know that water is H2O but (c) is competent enough in the use of the English word “water” that his fellow English speakers take his uses of “water” at face value, and (d) would defer to a chemist on Earth who tells him that water is H2O. Putnam judges and invites us to agree, that Oscar’s word “water” is true of x if and only if x is water, and that when Oscar says, while pointing at a liquid in a glass, “That is water,” his utterance is true if and only if the liquid in the glass is water. Putnam then describes a narrow psychological twin of Oscar’s, Toscar, who lives on Twin Earth, which is exactly like Earth except that wherever there is H2O on Earth there is a different liquid, whose molecular structure, XYZ, is very different from the molecular structure of H2O, but whose superficial qualifies are similar to those of water at normal pressures and temperatures. Putnam judges and invites us to agree that since XYZ does not bear the appropriate sameL relation to the portions of liquid that we call “water” on Earth, XYZ is not water, but another liquid that we may call twater. He infers that Toscar’s word “water” is true of x if and only if x is twater and that when Toscar says, while pointing at a liquid in a glass, “That is water,” his utterance is true if and only if the liquid in the glass is twater. Putnam concludes that the truth conditions of Oscar’s and Toscar’s utterances of sentences containing the term “water” are not determined by their narrow psychological states. In a final step he argues that this was true even in 1750, before chemists on Earth or Twin Earth discovered the chemical structures of water and twater.

Illusions of reference for general terms

When we use a proper name, we presuppose that it has a referent. Similarly, when we use a natural kind term, we presuppose that there are structural properties that are common to all the things to which we and others in our community apply the term. This similarity has led many philosophers (Schwartz 1977; Devitt & Sterelny 1987; Brown 2004; Hacking 2007; Wikforss 2013) to conclude that just as a singular term may fail to refer to anything due to a false presupposition, so a natural kind term may fail to have satisfaction conditions due to a false presupposition. A corollary is that just as a speaker may be under an illusion that a given proper name or a given use of a demonstrative refers to an object, so a speaker may be under an illusion that a natural kind term has satisfaction conditions. This conclusion and corollary result in a presuppositional theory of general SE.

An equally influential view is that natural kind terms are not analogous to proper names in this way. Putnam 1962b argues, for instance, that we can make sense of discovering that cats are not animals, but automata, and Kripke (1980: 122) agrees. If we can make sense of discovering that cats are automata, then our word “cat” may be true of (satisfied by) the very things—automata as it turns out—that we have called cats all along, even if our presupposition that “cat” is a natural kind term is false. Putnam thinks we can also make sense of discovering that a term such as “pencil,” which we believe to be an artifact term, is in fact a natural kind term. In short, we may discover that a term we take to be a natural kind term is an artifact term, and we may discover that a term we take to be an artifact term is a natural kind term, without concluding that the terms do not refer (Putnam 1975a: 240–242). This holistic theory of general SE is shaped by a commitment to epistemological holism, according to which any (or almost any) statement may be challenged and perhaps revised without changing the satisfaction conditions of the general terms that occur in it (Quine 1951; Putnam 1962a; Burge 1986b; Williamson 2007).

3.3.2 General content externalisms

General content externalism: The contents of a person’s general (non-singular) thoughts, such as Elms are deciduous trees, especially (but not exclusively) the parts of a person’s general contents that are expressed by the person’s uses of general terms, such as “elm,” are partly determined by causal relations that the person bears to objects and/or other speakers in the person’s physical or social environments.

Singular CE and general CE are often combined, but they are logically independent.

Arguments for general content externalism

The above arguments for general SE leave it open whether they can be extended to support general CE. McGinn 1977 suggests this extension. Burge 1979 argues in detail that our default practices of taking others’ words at face value is of a piece with our ordinary ways of attributing beliefs and thoughts to other speakers. This clarification of the consequences of SE seems inevitable in retrospect. If my local arborist says, for instance, “There are elm trees in Bloomington,” in taking his utterance of these words at face value I thereby also take him to have said and to have expressed the thought that there are elm trees in Bloomington. One can accept this observation without supposing that language is prior to thought, or vice versa. The notions of reference, linguistic meaning, and thought may be “interwoven in complex ways which render it impossible fully to analyze one in terms of the other” (Burge 1986b: 718; see also Williamson 2007: Ch.1).

Illusions of content expressed by general terms

On the presuppositional theory of general SE, if there are no structural properties that are common to all the things to which we apply a term T that we take to be a natural kind term, then the term fails to be true of anything. In these circumstances, a person who is unaware of the reference failure and tries to express a thought content by using a sentence that contains T fails to express any content at all. Such situations generate illusions of content expressed by general terms. Illusions of this sort, and the resulting presuppositional theory of general CE, are central to some of the debates discussed in section 6 below.

An equally influential variety of general CE implies that “Nearly anything can be topic of nonstandard theorizing” (Burge 1986b: 709). We may theorize, for instance, that cats are automata while knowing that others believe that cats are animals. The discovery that cats are automata would not, on this holistic theory of general CE, engender illusions of content expressed by the general term “cat.”

4. Content externalism and epistemic possibility

Both presuppositional and holistic theories of general CE make it difficult to formulate some of our commonsense judgments about what is epistemically possible. For instance, suppose that, as we believe, elms and beeches are different species of tree. Then according to general CE, in a way that is mirrored in SE by the rigidity of the satisfaction conditions for “elm” and “beech,” elms can’t be beeches: there is no possible world in which elms trees are beech trees. Before I learned that elm trees are not beech trees, however, it was in some sense “epistemically possible” for me that elm trees are beech trees. I cannot analyze this sense of epistemic possibility in terms of a possible world in which elm trees are beech trees, since I have now learned elms are not beech trees and I therefore believe there is no such possible world.

In non-skeptical contexts the standard solution to this problem is roughly to say that given our sensory evidence, there is a “qualitatively identical epistemic situation” in which the references of some of our words differ in such a way that the content we express by our utterances of “elm trees are beech trees” is true. More precisely,

Suppose that in the actual world \(w_1\), at a given time \(t\),

  • speaker \(A\) uses a sentence \(S\) to express content \(p\), on the basis of \(A\)’s sensory evidence \(E,\)
  • the negation of \(S\) is true in \(w_1\), and
  • speaker A lacks sufficient evidence to judge responsibly that the negation of \(S\) is true in \(w_1\).

Then it is “epistemically possibleK” that \(p\) for speaker \(A\) with sensory evidence \(E\) at time \(t\) if and only if there exists a counterfactual possible world \(w_2\) in which

  1. There exists an epistemic counterpart \(A^*\) of \(A\) whose sensory evidence \(E\) and linguistic behavior up to and including time \(t\) are the same as \(A\)’s,
  2. \(A^*\)’s utterances of sentence \(S\) express a true content \(q\).

(The subscript “K” in “epistemically possibleK” refers to Kripke, who first sketched this analysis in Kripke 1980 [103–104]. For applications of the same sort of analysis, see Block & Stalnaker 1999: 6–7; Putnam 1990: 62; and Yablo 2008: 185–188.)

To apply this analysis to the commonsense judgment that it was once epistemically possible for me that elm trees are beech trees, the content \(q\) cannot be that elm trees are beech trees. In many other cases, however, the content \(q\) need not differ from the content \(p\) for it to be “epistemically possibleK” that \(p\) for speaker \(A\) with sensory evidence E at time \(t\). In 2018 it was “epistemically possibleK” for me that there are no Asian Carp in Lake Michigan. I now know that there are Asian Carp in Lake Michigan and that they have been there since 2010. If, as I believe, it is a contingent fact that there are Asian Carp in Lake Michigan, then there is a counterfactual possible world in which my evidence in 2018 was the same as my evidence in 2018 in the actual world, but my utterances of “There are no Asian Carp in Lake Michigan” express the true content that there are no Asian Carp in Lake Michigan. Cases of this second type are also important to the debates discussed in sections 6 and 7 below.

5. The central dilemma for content externalism in skeptical contexts

When we solve the problem explained in section 4 by analyzing epistemic possibility as epistemically possibleK, we apply a method that is structurally similar to the method we use to construct Twin Earth cases that support CE: we hold constant some of a person’s physical and mental states, including the person’s “qualitative epistemic situation,” while stipulating that his environment differs from his actual environment in ways that imply that his thought contents differ from his thought contents in the actual world. In contexts in which skepticism is not at issue, this method has convinced many philosophers to accept both CE and the thesis that one’s sensory experiences are determined by one’s narrow psychological states. When one considers the method in skeptical contexts, however, this combination of views is puzzling.

The puzzle arises because the method enables us to describe, for each of us, any number of subjectively equivalent worlds in which our sensory surfaces are affected in the same way, we express our beliefs and thoughts by using sentence tokens with the same syntactic shapes, but the beliefs and thoughts we thereby express differ from our actual beliefs and thoughts (Ebbs 1996: 510; see also Blackburn 1984: 312, on “spinning the possible worlds”). Our descriptions of these worlds appear to imply that from our subjective, first-person point of view, we cannot discriminate between them. We therefore seem to face

The Central Dilemma:

Either:

First horn. We do not know without empirical investigation the contents of the thoughts we express by using our sentences, since we do not know without empirical investigation which of our subjectively equivalent worlds we are in, and the contents of the thoughts we express by using our sentences are not the same in all our subjectively equivalent worlds.

or

Second horn. We know without empirical investigation the contents of the thoughts we express by using our sentences, and from this knowledge we can infer that we are not in any of our subjectively equivalent worlds in which the contents of the thoughts we express by using our sentences differ from what we know them to be.

The first horn is incompatible with our ordinary assumption that we each have minimal self-knowledge—we each know without empirical investigation what thoughts our own utterances express. The second horn conflicts with the Cartesian skeptical intuition that we may actually be in any one of our subjectively equivalent worlds.

Content externalists typically reject the first horn. They note, for instance, that

[W]hatever fixes the content of the first-order belief that I express by saying “There is water in the glass” also fixes in the same way the embedded content in the second-order belief I express by saying “I believe there is water in the glass”. (Shoemaker 1994: 260n7; see also Davidson 1988: 664)

Some content externalists (Gibbons 1996; Brown 2004) argue that such second-order beliefs are knowledge if they are true in a contextually relevant range of circumstances. Other content externalists (Burge 1988; Wright 1994; Ebbs 1996; Goldberg 2002) argue that the key to reconciling our ordinary assumption that we have minimal self-knowledge with CE lies not in the reliability of our second-order beliefs about the contents of our thoughts, phenomenological signs, or empirical investigation, but in our activity of thinking and self-ascribing our own thoughts. See the entry on externalism and self-knowledge for details.

The rest of the present entry grants that minimal self-knowledge is compatible with CE. The entry focuses on the second horn of the central dilemma, revisiting the first horn only as needed to assess debates about the second horn. It is this horn that forces us to confront (Q), namely,

Is the Cartesian skeptical intuition that we may actually be in any one of our subjectively equivalent worlds compatible with CE despite appearances to the contrary, or, if not, are there reformulations of the intuition that are compatible with CE and enable us to formulate challenging Cartesian skeptical arguments?

6. Content externalism and knowledge of one’s external environment

McKinsey 1991 challenges content externalists to explain how they can consistently accept three claims to which they are apparently committed, namely,

(1)
Oscar knows independently of empirical investigation that he is thinking that water is wet.
(2)
The proposition that Oscar is thinking that water is wet conceptually implies E.
(3)
The proposition E cannot be known independently of empirical investigation.

where E is a proposition describing “the relations that Oscar bears to other speakers or objects in his external environment” (McKinsey 1991: 10). To say that the proposition that Oscar is thinking that water is wet “conceptually implies” a proposition E, according to McKinsey, is to say that

there is a correct deduction of [E] from [the proposition that Oscar is thinking that water is wet], a deduction whose only premisses other than [the proposition that Oscar is thinking that water is wet] are necessary or conceptual truths that are knowable a priori, and each of whose steps follows from previous lines by a self-evident inference rule of some adequate system of natural deduction. (McKinsey 1991: 14, with the bracketed substitutions for \(p\) and \(q\))

McKinsey reasons that if (1) and (2) are true, then contrary to (3) one can know a proposition E describing “the relations that Oscar bears to other speakers or objects in his external environment” without empirical investigation.

To support (3) McKinsey points out that CE is defined in terms of narrow and wide psychological states. He calls these notions Cartesian because

a narrow state should be (roughly) a state from which the existence of external objects cannot be deduced, and a wide state would be one from which the existence of external objects can be deduced. (McKinsey 1991: 14)

From this he infers (on page 16)

(*)
One cannot know a priori that there are external objects in each of one’s subjectively equivalent worlds (worlds in which one’s narrow psychological states are the same as they are in the actual world).

McKinsey 1991 concludes that a content externalist who accepts (1) and (2) is thereby also committed to accepting (3), which is incompatible with (*). This is a sharpened and strengthened version of the second horn of the Central Dilemma explained in section 5.

6.1 General content externalism and conceptual implication

One way to evaluate McKinsey’s challenge is to ask whether a content externalist is committed to accepting a proposition of the form (2), where E is a proposition describing relations that Oscar bears to other speakers or objects in his external environment (Brueckner 1992a: 113). As a candidate for E, McKinsey may have had something like the following proposition in mind (from Brueckner 1992a: 112):

(E1)
Oscar inhabits an environment containing H2O and not XYZ.

The problem with this candidate for E is that on a holistic theory of CE, as Burge explains,

An individual or community might (logically speaking) have been wrong in thinking that there was such a thing as water. It is epistemically possible—it might have turned out—that contrary to an individual’s belief, water did not exist. (Burge 1982: 97)

We may read “epistemically possible” here as “epistemically possibleK,” as the continuation of the passage makes clear:

Part of what we do when we conceive of such cases is to rely on actual circumstances in which these illusions do not hold—rely on the actual existence of water—in order to individuate the notions we cite in specifying the propositional attitudes. We utilize—must utilize, I think— the actual existence of physical stuffs and things, or of other speakers or thinkers, in making sense of counter-factual projections in which we think at least some of these surroundings away. (Burge 1982: 97)

Applying this method we may describe counterfactual worlds in which (a) Oscar’s sensory experiences are the same as they are in the actual world, and (b) there is no water, and (c) either Oscar’s linguistic community theorizes that water is H2O or Oscar himself does so, and (d) Oscar’s uses, whether in thought or speech, of “water is wet” express the same contents that they actually express (Burge 1982: 98). (Clause (d) would be true, for instance, if Oscar or some members of his linguistic community are causally related to instances of hydrogen and oxygen, so that the compound expression H2O has the same content for Oscar as it has for us.)

The reasoning just sketched supports the conclusion that Oscar cannot know (E1) without empirical investigation. It also supports (N):

(N)
It is necessary that if Oscar is thinking that water is wet, then one of the following must be the case: (i) water exists, or (ii) Oscar theorizes that H2O exists, or (iii) Oscar is part of a community of speakers some of whom theorize that H2O exists. (Brueckner 1992a: 116)

The above argument for (N) relies on “the actual existence of water…in order to individuate the notions we cite in specifying the propositional attitudes” (Burge 1982: 97), however, and therefore does not establish or presuppose that CE conceptually implies (N) (Brueckner 1992a: 116).

If the holistic theory of CE that leads to these conclusions is correct, there may be a sound argument for the conclusion that in each of our subjectively equivalent worlds there exists some physical objects (Brueckner 1992a: 118). Although such an argument would challenge (*), it would be compatible with the Cartesian intuition that we may actually be in any of our subjectively equivalent worlds and would therefore evade the second horn.

6.2 Atomic natural kind concepts and a priori knowledge

Some content externalists (e.g. McGinn 1989) accept (C)

(C)
If the concept of X is an atomic, natural kind concept, then it is metaphysically impossible to possess it unless one has causally interacted with instances of X.

Suppose that (C) and the presuppositional theory of general content externalism (section 3.3.2) are true solely in virtue of conceptual implications (section 6.1) and that one can know without empirical investigation that one has the concept water. Then one will be tempted to suppose that a person who has no views about the chemical structure of water may infer, on purely a priori grounds, i.e. independently of empirical investigation, that water exists, as follows (from Boghossian 1997 [1998: 275], with numerals changed to letters and the order of the premises switched):

(a)
I have the concept water.
(b)
If I have the concept water, then water exists.
(c)
Water exists.

The key question is whether one can know that (b) a priori. (C) implies that if water is an atomic natural kind concept, then (b) is true. But this does not show that one can know that (b) a priori. A holistic general content externalist who accepts (C) may reject the claim that one can know that (b) a priori if (as McLaughlin & Tye 1998: 311, argue) they can make sense of accepting

i.
We can know a priori that we have the concept of water, even if the concept of water is an atomic, natural kind concept,

while rejecting

ii.
We can know a priori that the concept of water is an atomic natural kind concept.

The key point is that on some holistic theories of general CE, whether a concept is atomic depends on external factors and therefore cannot be known a priori (McLaughlin & Tye 1998: 311). To see why, suppose Oscar is minimally competent in the use of the linguistic expression “H2O” in English, while not realizing that in English “H2O” is semantically complex and expresses a complex (non-atomic) concept. By the standards of CE, Oscar’s uses of “H2O” express a complex concept, even though Oscar is unaware of this fact. Now suppose that on Twin Earth, “H2O” expresses an atomic concept, and Toscar, whose narrow states are the same as Oscar’s, is minimally competent in the use of “H2O” in Twin-English. By the standards of CE, Toscar’s uses of “H2O” express an atomic concept. This thought experiment (from Korman 2006: 514–515) and others like it imply that one cannot know a priori whether a given concept that one has is atomic.

6.3 Transmission of warrant

Another line of inquiry grants that by reflecting on the arguments for CE one can know that (a) and (b) (of section 6.2) “without empirical investigation” but denies that I may infer, without relying on any additional premises, that (c), and thereby come to know that (c) without empirical investigation. This line of inquiry accepts

Closure for (a)–(c). If I know that (a) and I know that (b) [i.e. if (a) then (c)], then I know that (c).

The focus of the inquiry is not on Closure for (a)–(c), but on a corresponding principle regarding justifiable inferences, understood as changes in view (Harman 1986):

Warrant Transmission for (a)–(c). If I know that (a) and (b) without empirical investigation, then I may infer, without relying on any additional premises, that (c), and thereby come to know that (c) without empirical investigation.

Against Warrant Transmission for (a)–(c) one might reason as follows. Suppose I know that (a) “without empirical investigation” yet also without ruling out the empirical possibility that my word “water” fails to express a concept due to the falsity of my presupposition that there are structural properties that are common to all the things to which I and others apply “water” (see section 3.3.2 above on the presupposition theory of general CE). Suppose also that I know that (b) without empirical investigation. Since (a) and (b) logically imply (c), given Closure for (a)–(c), I know that (c). I nevertheless do not know that (c) solely based on my knowledge that (a) and (b) and my knowledge that (a) and (b) logically imply (c). The reason is that my knowledge that (a)—my knowledge that I have the concept of water—was acquired by my being in a state which is subjectively indistinguishable from being in a different state in a different world in which, due to facts about my external environment in that world about which I am ignorant, my word “water” does not express a concept at all. This argument against Warrant Transmission for (a)–(c) is due in essentials to M. Davies 1998 and Wright 2000. It implies that a necessary condition of my coming to know that (a) without empirical investigation is that I already, and independently, know that (c). (Wright 1985 applies an earlier version of the same basic strategy to explain “the intuitive inadequacy of G. E. Moore’s ‘proof of the existence of the external world’” [1985: 434].)

One might object that this type of criticism of Warrant Transmission for (a)–(c) “rests on an internalist epistemology that would be rejected by epistemological externalism” (Brown 2004: 251). On a reliabilist account of knowledge (Goldman 1976), I may know that (a) and (b), infer, without relying on any additional premises, that (c), and thereby come to know that (c), if the sorts of subjectively equivalent situations that are incompatible with my knowing these propositions are not relevant to assessing whether my acceptance of them is reliable in the sense required for knowledge.

This objection is not decisive if one accepts a contextualist explanation of the failure of Warrant Transmission for (a)–(c) with the following two parts. First, in ordinary contexts the epistemic possibility that there is no water is not relevant to whether or not I know that (a), so I can know “without empirical inquiry” that (a) in such contexts. Second, in a context in which I claim to know that (c) without empirical inquiry, the possibility that (c) is false is relevant and must be ruled out for me to know (c) without empirical inquiry (M. Davies 1998, 358–359). This explanation of why Warrant Transmission for (a)–(c) fails is compatible with a reliabilist account of my knowledge that (a) and is therefore not vulnerable to the criticism in the previous paragraph. It also suggests that the initial appearance that there is a transmission of warrant for (a)–(c) is based on an equivocation on the meaning of “know without empirical investigation.” I may “know that (a) without empirical investigation” if I presuppose (c) and I am in fact able to express the thought that, say, water is wet, simply by using my sentence “water is wet” without engaging in any empirical investigation beyond those I have already completed. But I cannot know (c) without empirical investigation in this way.

One might also reject the supposition that one can derive knowledge that (b) solely from one’s a priori knowledge of CE. If one accepts a holistic theory of CE, one might argue that the sort of knowledge we have of our own thoughts without empirical investigation does not yield any substantive knowledge of the “individuation conditions” of those thoughts, hence does not yield knowledge that (b) (Raffman 1998).

6.4 On knowing one’s environment without empirical investigation

Despite the arguments reviewed in sections 6.1–6.3, one might argue that one can know a truth about one’s environment “via introspection and conceptual analysis” (Sawyer 1998: 525, with Arabic numerals changed to letters) by reasoning as follows:

(d)
I am thinking a water-thought.
(e)
If I am thinking a water-thought, then I’m in a water-world.
(f)
Therefore, I am in a water-world.

where a “water-thought” is a thought, such as the thought that water is wet, that contains or involves the concept water, and a subject is in a “water-world” if and only if “either the subject’s environment contains water and water is a natural kind, or the subject is part of a community which has the concept of water, whether or not water is a natural kind” (Sawyer 1998: 525). The argument (d)–(e) is clearly valid. Premise (d) follows from our having minimal self-knowledge on a given occasion when we are thinking that water is wet. And some philosophers (Sawyer 1998; Warfield 1998) argue that we can know (e) without empirical investigation, hence by conceptual analysis alone. These philosophers in effect claim that the antecedent of (e), namely (d), conceptually implies the consequent of (e), namely (f), in the sense of “conceptually implies” that McKinsey 1991 defines. They conclude that CE is incompatible with (3), the standard view that one cannot know about one’s external environment without empirical investigation. As Sawyer later observes, however, “the heart of the so-called ‘McKinsey paradox’” is that an argument of the sort developed by Sawyer 1998 “seems to provide an implausibly quick response to the external world skeptic” (Sawyer 2015: 75).

6.5 Singular content externalism and a priori knowledge of the world

Sections 6.2–6.4 focused on the consequences of general CE. Singular CE raises different but related puzzles about whether one can have a priori knowledge of one’s environment. To see why, suppose Suzy utters the sentence, “That is poisonous,” while pointing at a snake named Fred, thereby expressing her thought that that [i.e. Fred] is poisonous. According to the direct reference theory of demonstratives (due to Kaplan 1989, see section 3.1 above), the content of the thought Suzy thereby expresses is a singular proposition that contains Fred, the snake, and the property of being poisonous. Suzy might have been subject to an illusion of demonstrating a particular snake when in fact there was no snake to refer to. It therefore seems that Suzy cannot know a priori that Suzy is thinking that [Fred] is poisonous, or that that [Fred] exists. But consider the following proposition:

(**)
If Suzy is thinking that that [Fred] is poisonous then that [Fred] exists.

(**) has the form “\(Fa \supset \exists x(x=a)\)”. Assuming the rule EG (existential generalization) and standard axioms of identity, Suzy can therefore infer (**) a priori. Moreover, (**) itself implies that that [Fred] exists, since the proposition that [Fred] is poisonous is “embedded” in it (Lasonen-Aarnio 2006: 441). These points imply that Suzy can know (**) a priori and that she can infer a priori from (**) that that [Fred] exists. A corollary is that privileged access to the contents of one’s singular thoughts is not necessary for deriving contingent existence claims without empirical investigation (2006: 442).

These inferences depend on the assumption that the logic of singular CE is classical. In a non-classical free logic, by contrast, the form “\(Fa \supset \exists x(x=a)\)” is not logically valid: in cases in which “\(a\)” is not assigned a reference, “both ‘\(Fa\)’ and conditionals containing ‘\(Fa\)’ have no truth value and so are not true on those interpretations” (McKinsey 2006: 449). If one adopts a free logic, then if singular CE is true, privileged access to the contents of one’s singular thoughts is necessary for deriving contingent existence claims without empirical investigation.

7. Is the hypothesis that we are always brains in vats self-refuting?

In “Brains in a Vat” (Putnam 1981: Ch. 1) Putnam argues that the supposition that we are and always have been brains in vats is “self-refuting.” His argument for this surprising conclusion started a stream of illuminating literature about how to reconstruct and evaluate it.

7.1 The first formulation of the BIV argument

Suppose my brain was transferred to a vat last night without my knowledge. Then by the standards of general CE, the contents of the thoughts I express by using my sentences would remain the same, at least for a while. In the first several days after the transfer, and perhaps for much longer, my utterances of “I have hands,” for instance, would express the false content that I have hands. (Section 7.4 discusses the epistemological consequences of this sort of possibility.) Putnam’s argument takes this point for granted and considers the more extreme situation in which a molecule-for-molecule twin of my brain exists from the beginning to the end of its “life” in a vat of nutrients stimulated by automatic machinery that “came into existence by some kind of cosmic chance or coincidence” (Putnam 1981: 12). Let “BIV” abbreviate this extreme situation.

In an ordinary non-skeptical context, it seems obvious that we can use the English sentence “Are we BIVs?” to ask ourselves, Are we BIVs? and that the answer is “No.” This complacent answer seems precarious, however, if we suppose, as many philosophers do, that our sensory experiences would be the same whether or not we are BIVs. For this supposition appears to imply that our ordinary non-skeptical belief that we are not BIVs receives no support from our sensory experiences and therefore lacks the kind of epistemological justification we ordinarily take it to have.

A BIV has never had and never will have any causal relations with things to which English speakers apply their words, or with members of the English-speaking community, on which the references of English words and the contents express by utterances of English sentences depend, according to SE and CE. If we accept CE in any of its standard forms (see section 3 above), we are thereby committed to accepting Putnam’s causal constraint on reference, according to which, “One cannot refer to certain kinds of things, e.g. trees, if one has no causal interaction at all with them, or with things in terms of which they can be described” (Putnam 1981: 12). The causal constraint on reference implies that since BIVs have no causal relations with trees, brains, or vats, or with anything in terms of which trees, brains, or vats can be described, such brains are unable to refer to or think about trees, brains, or vats.

The causal constraint does not tell us what thoughts a BIV expresses when it uses sentences of Vat-English, the language it speaks. Putnam 1981 suggests three possible ways of interpreting a BIV’s basic observational vocabulary, such as “tree”: “trees-in-the-image,” “electrical impulses that cause tree experiences,” and “features of the program that are responsible for those electronic impulses.” (Putnam 1981: 14). Suppose we grant that for each of us there is a subjectively equivalent world in which we are BIVs, and that in those subjectively equivalent worlds our utterances may be interpreted in one of the ways Putnam suggests. It then appears that for all we know on the basis of our sensory experiences, we may actually in the world in which we are BIVs and our words “brain” and “vat” are not satisfied by brains or vats, respectively, but, instead, by (as it may be) brains in the image and vats in the image, respectively. Putnam’s BIV argument is meant to show that that this appearance is self-refuting, as follows:

If we are …brains in a vat, then what we now mean by “we are brains in a vat” is that we are brains in a vat in the image or something of that kind (if we mean anything at all). But part of the hypothesis that we are brains in a vat is that we are aren’t brains in a vat in the image (i.e. what we are “hallucinating” isn’t that we are brains in a vat). So, if we are brains in a vat, then the sentence, “We are brains in a vat” says something false (if it says anything). In short, if we are brains in a vat, then “We are brains in a vat” is false. (Putnam 1981: 15)

This reasoning is “is neither ‘empirical’ nor ‘a priori’, but has elements of both ways of investigating”; it is based on reflections “about what is reasonably possible assuming certain general premisses, or making certain broad theoretical assumptions” (Putnam 1981: 16). Its central premises, including the causal constraint on reference, rest on empirical generalizations about how ordinary English speakers interpret each other, what their words refer to, and what thoughts they express by uttering them.

7.2 A priori reconstructions of the BIV argument

Standard reconstructions of Putnam’s BIV argument nevertheless take for granted that the goal of Putnam’s BIV argument is, or should be, to show by strictly a priori methods that we are not BIVs (Brueckner 1986: 160; Wright 1994: 222).

Brueckner’s reconstruction begins by stipulating that “brain*” refers to “the computer program feature that causes experiences in the BIV that are qualitatively indistinguishable from normal experiences that represent brains,” and “vat*” refers to “the computer program feature that causes experiences in the BIV that are qualitatively indistinguishable from normal experiences that represent vats” (Brueckner 2011: 503). These stipulated interpretations of the BIV’s terms “brain” and “vat” imply that a BIV is not a brain* in a vat* (Brueckner 2011: 503). The reconstructed argument runs as follows:

  1. Either I am a BIV (speaking vat-English) or I am a non-BIV (speaking English).
  2. If I am a BIV (speaking vat-English), then my utterances of “I am a BIV” are true iff I am a brain* in a vat*.
  3. If I am a BIV (speaking vat-English), then I am not a brain* in a vat*.
  4. If I am a BIV (speaking vat-English), then my utterances of “I am a BIV” are not true. [b,c]
  5. If I am a non-BIV (speaking English), then my utterances of “I am a BIV” are true iff I am a BIV.
  6. If I am a non-BIV (speaking English), then my utterances of “I am a BIV” are not true. [e]
  7. My utterances of “I am a BIV” are not true.
  8. My utterances of “I am a BIV” are not true iff my utterances of “I am not a BIV” are true.
  9. My utterances of “I am not a BIV” are true. [g, h] (Brueckner 2011: 503–504, with “false” replaced by “not true”)

Brueckner notes that if I am agnostic about whether I am a BIV, then this argument does not establish that I am not a BIV. To get to the conclusion that I am not a BIV from (i) I need the following premise:

(t)
My utterances of “I am not a BIV” are true iff I am not a BIV.

This is an instance of the following schema for specifying the conditions under which the predicate “true” applies to sentences I can use:

(T)
My utterances of “_____” are true iff _____.

Instances of (T), such as (t), employ what is called disquotation: they explain the conditions under which a quoted sentence is true by dropping the quotes and directly using the sentence. Instances of (T) are unproblematic in most ordinary, non-skeptical contexts.

If I don’t know whether or not I am a BIV, however, it appears that I do not know whether or not the truth conditions of my utterances of “I am not a BIV” are true iff I am not a brain* in a vat*, so I am not justified in asserting (t) (Brueckner 1986: 160; see also Stephens & Russow 1985; Kinghan 1986). This argument focuses on (t) but it also implies that I am not justified in asserting instances of (Sat)

(Sat)
My word “___” refers to (is satisfied by) x if and only if x is a ____.

such as

(Satbrain)
My word “brain” refers to (is satisfied by) x if and only if x is a brain.

in the context of the BIV argument. For like (t), (Satbrain) employs disquotation: it explains the conditions under which a quoted predicate is true by dropping the quotes and directly using the predicate. And if I don’t know whether or not I am a BIV, it appears that I do not know whether or not the truth conditions of my word “brain” refers to (is satisfied by) x if and only if x is a brain*, so I am not justified in asserting (Satbrain).

Against this, one might reason as follows:

Disquotation is, on both the standard and the skeptical hypotheses, a valid step within either English or vat-English. And surely we don’t need to know which of these languages we are speaking in order to know we are speaking the one we are speaking. But that seems to be the only thing we do need to know, in order to apply disquotation to ourselves with confidence. (Christensen 1993: 305; see also Hill 1990: 110n4; Wright 1994: 225)

The idea is that we do not suppose that we can toggle back and forth, when considering the BIV argument, between two distinct languages, English and Vat-English, but that we can use disquotation in the one language we actually speak, whether we suppose it is English or Vat-English. This reasoning motivates the a priori reconstructions of Putnam’s BIV argument that accept disquotation.

The simplest such reconstruction was first proposed independently by McIntyre (1984: 59–60) and Williams (1984: 261) and has since been modified and adopted by several others (Tymoczko 1989; Brueckner 1992b and 2011; and Button 2013 and 2016). Here’s a typical formulation of it (Brueckner 2011: 504, with “tree” replaced by “brain”):

(A)
If I am a BIV, then my word “brain” does not refer to brains.
(B)
My word “brain” refers to brains.
(C)
Therefore, I am not a BIV.

Premise (A) is a consequence of Putnam’s causal constraint on reference (Putnam 1981: 12). Premise (B) is an instance of (Sat). If one accepts the defense of disquotation quoted above, it appears plausible to suppose that it is not question-begging to accept (Sat) when justifying premise (B) of the argument (A)–(C), but premise (A) becomes doubtful for reasons discussed below.

There are similar a priori reconstructions that do not explicitly concern reference, such as the following:

(A′)
If I am a BIV, then I cannot consider the question whether I am a BIV.
(B′)
I can consider the question whether I am a BIV.
(C)
Therefore, I am not a BIV.

This argument assumes that we know (B′) a priori. This is not a fundamentally new assumption, since part of the assumption that we can apply disquotation to our own words is that we know what thoughts we thereby express, and if this sort of knowledge is available to us a priori, then so is knowledge of what thought we express when we use and accept (B′).

One possible concern about reconstructions (A)–(C) and (A′)–(C) is that warrant for their premises does not transmit to their conclusions (see 6.3 above). The problem about transmission of warrant does not seem to arise for Putnam’s BIV argument, however, because “there is no suggestion … that envathood would generate illusions of content” (Wright 2000: 159; see also Thorpe & Wright 2022: 74).

Another possible concern about reconstructions (A)–(C) and (A′)–(C) is that if I suspend my ordinary beliefs to the extent of supposing I am a BIV, it is unclear why I am entitled to accept (A), and (A′). It seems that if I am reasoning strictly a priori and accept disquotation then contrary to (A) I should accept “If I am a BIV, then my word ‘brain’ refers to brains.” But this conditional is of no help in deriving (C) given (B). For parallel reasons, (A′) should be replaced by “If I am a BIV, then I can consider the question whether I am a BIV” (Ebbs 2016: 28–29; Kinghan 1986: 165).

One might suppose that I can know a priori that “Vat-English is always something other than the language we are speaking” (Tymoczko 1989: 284–285). In the context of Putnam’s BIV argument it is not question-begging to suppose that Vat-English is the language spoken by a brain that is always in a vat. I cannot infer a priori from this supposition, however, that Vat-English is not the language I speak (Brueckner 1995: 92–93; Ebbs 1996: note 32).

7.3 Contextually a priori reconstructions of the BIV argument

A different approach to reconstructing Putnam’s BIV argument is to accept Putnam’s methodological claim that his BIV argument “is neither ‘empirical’ nor ‘a priori’, but has elements of both ways of investigating” (Putnam 1981: 16). There are several reasons for doing so.

First, CE implies that it takes empirical investigation to learn what our words, including our words “brain” and “vat,” refer to (are satisfied by), and, by doing so, to learn whether there is a possible subjectively equivalent world in which duplicates of our brains “live” in vats, tended by automatic machinery. Aristotle believed that the function of the brain is to cool the blood. It was an empirical discovery that the brain is the center of the human nervous system. If we were to suspend our empirical beliefs, as radical skeptics invite us to do, we would have no basis for concluding that there is a possible subjectively equivalent world in which duplicates of our brains “live” in vats, tended by automatic machinery (Putnam 1998 [2012: 527]).

Second, Putnam’s versions of SE and CE are rooted in observations about our actual practices of taking speakers to be minimally competent in the use of English words. A speaker who suspends all her empirical beliefs about what trees are and does not affirm any demonstrative sentences that contain the word “tree”, such as, “That’s a tree,” cannot be regarded as minimally competent in the use of the word “tree.” This is not to say that to be minimally competent in the use of “tree” one must be able to distinguish a tree from every possible type of thing that looks and feels like a tree. A speaker may count as minimally competent in the use of a word even if all the sentences containing the word that she accepts are false. But to be minimally competent in the use of a word one must have some idea of what thoughts one expresses by uttering sentences that contain the word. Without some idea of what one can use the words to say, one is not able to use them at all (Putnam 1975a: 247–257; Ebbs 2016: 29–30).

When we consider the BIV possibility we presuppose many empirical beliefs and theories. This point about where we begin when evaluating the argument fits well with Putnam’s more general methodological principle (MP) according to which we can do no better in our inquiries that to start in the middle, relying on already established beliefs and inferences, and applying our best methods for re-evaluating beliefs and inferences and arriving at new ones. (Putnam’s commitment to this principle is evident in Putnam 1962a, the conclusions of which, he later says, are “closely connected with what was later called ‘externalism’” (Putnam 2013: 193).)

This methodological principle does not beg the question against BIV skepticism, since it allows for the possibility of a reductio ad absurdum of our starting assumption that our empirical beliefs are justified (Quine 1975: 68). Assuming MP, Putnam’s BIV argument can be interpreted an attempt to show that the supposition that we are BIVs is self-refuting and therefore does not reduce our starting beliefs to absurdity.

The a priori reconstructions suppose that we may be BIVs, and Houdini-like, try to show that we are not. If we allow ourselves to rely on our starting beliefs, we need to rethink the role of the supposition that we are brains in vats in Putnam’s BIV argument. Putnam compares the statement “I am a BIV” with the statement that all general statements are false (Putnam 1981: 7). At first it appears that this second statement may be true or false, and that it would take some investigation to discover what its truth-value is, but on reflection we see that it must be false, since the supposition that it is true yields a contradiction. Putnam also notes that “I am a BIV” is self-refuting in something like the way that “I do not exist” is self-refuting: my utterances of “I do not exist” express contents that may be evaluated as true only in contexts of evaluation that differ from their contexts of utterance (Kaplan 1989: 495). When I utter “I do not exist,” what I say is obviously false. The statement “I am a BIV” is similarly self-refuting, according to Putnam, but in a way that requires more reflection for me to see.

These comparisons suggest that we read Putnam’s BIV argument as follows. The supposition “I am a BIV” appears to be possibly true, just as, when one first considers it, the statement that all general statements are false appears to be possibly true. On reflection, based on our background empirical beliefs about brains and vats and the principles of SE and CE, however, we can see that the supposition cannot be true if we are considering it, hence it must be false. We can see that it is false not because we define the BIV possibility as one that we are not in, but because “the world picture that [the skeptic] needs to give content to his talk of computers, brains, electrical impulses, chemicals needed to keep the brains a live, and so on is simply stolen from our world picture” (Putnam 1998 [2012: 527]). This version of the BIV argument is contextually a priori in roughly the following sense: if it is successful, it shows that the principles and premises on which it relies, while not a priori in the traditional philosophical sense, are so deeply embedded in our current theory of the world that we cannot specify any minimally plausible way in which they may be false. (The term “contextually a priori” is from Putnam 1976a [1983: 95]. See Ebbs 2015 and Putnam 2015 for a discussion of how to clarify it.)

Arguments (A)–(C) and (A′)–(C) are unproblematic if we do not require that their premises be justified a priori. We may instead support their premises with contextually a priori reasons that presuppose our empirically informed “world picture,” so that our starting position when considering the BIV argument is not one of suspending all our empirical beliefs. When viewed in this way, the arguments are successful if they show us how and why our initial impression that we might be a BIV is not compatible with our commitment to general CE. (See Ebbs 1992, 1996, and 2016 for a development and defense of this interpretation of Putnam’s BIV argument.)

7.4 Consequences for epistemic possibility

Suppose one of the above reconstructions of Putnam’s BIV argument reconstructions is sound. Then it is not epistemically possibleK that I am a BIV: there is no counterfactual world w in which (a) I exist, (b) my sensory evidence and linguistic behavior are the same as it they are in the actual world, and (c) my sentence “I am a BIV” expresses a content that is true in w. Putnam’s BIV argument focuses on clause (c). But the argument may also lead me to doubt that in Putnam’s BIV scenario my sensory evidence is the same as it is in the actual world. For if I may rely on the argument to show that is not “epistemically possibleK” for me that I am a BIV, I may also characterize my sensory evidence in representational terms. A further, more speculative step is to theorize that even my sensory experiences are not determined by my narrow psychological states (Byrne & Tye 2006).

The BIV argument does not rule out that my brain was recently transferred to a vat without my knowledge. Some philosophers (e.g. Tymozcko 1989; Putnam 1998; Thorpe 2019; Thorpe & Wright 2022) argue that we may rely on our beliefs about the current state of medical technology, not on semantics, to rule it out. Others argue that “the problem posed by the recent-envatment hypothesis is equivalent in power and plausibility to that posed by the Putnamian hypothesis” (Christensen 1993: 314–315).

7.5 Skepticism about objectivity

Thomas Nagel argues that Putnam’s BIV argument, if sound, immediately raises another skeptical problem:

If I accept the argument, I must conclude that a brain a vat can’t think truly that it is a brain in a vat, even though others can think this about it. What follows? Only that I can’t express my skepticism by saying “Perhaps I am a brain in a vat.” Instead, I must say, “Perhaps I cannot even think the truth of what I am, because I lack the necessary concepts and my circumstances make it impossible for me to acquire them!” If this doesn’t qualify as skepticism, I don’t know what does. (Nagel 1986: 73)

Nagel presupposes that our representation of the world is more encompassing, less limited, and therefore more objective than that of a BIV. He raises the possibility that (a) there are true thoughts we are unable to express or acquire and that (b) among these there may be true thoughts that, if we could grasp them, would lead us to question the objectivity of our current thoughts, by revealing to us truths about our situation that are more encompassing, less limited, than the ones we can now grasp. One might try to give some content to this worry by reasoning by analogy: just as we grasp thoughts relative to which the thoughts of a BIV are severely limited, so perhaps another being can grasp thoughts relative to which our thoughts are analogously limited (Ebbs 1992: 253–255; see also Smith 1984; Wright 1994: 240; Forbes 1995: 220; Button 2013: 137; Sundell 2016: section 14.5; and Thorpe & Wright 2022: 86–87). Thorpe & Wright 2022 argue that

at least one, bare bones, characterization of [this skeptical] predicament needs only logical concepts, concepts of ourselves as thinking, epistemic agents, concepts of metasemantics and certain kinds of evaluative concepts: it is the predicament in which there are states of affairs to which we are so related that we cannot refer to their constituent objects and properties, nor therefore represent them in true thoughts, and whose obtaining would be of enormous significance to us could we but know of it. (Thorpe & Wright 2022, 86–87; for a similar strategy for responding to Putnam’s BIV argument, see Chalmers 2018: 630)

This worry, if unanswered, generates skepticism about objectivity (Ebbs 1992: section IV).

A natural first question to ask is whether we can make sense of skepticism about objectivity if we accept CE. The following argument suggests that we cannot. We have good reasons to believe that if we were to learn a natural language we don’t already know, such as Danish or Chinese, we would thereby learn new concepts and come to be able to express true thoughts that we could not express before. We may be surprised by the concepts and thoughts we acquire in this way. But the speakers of these languages live in the same spatiotemporal world that we live in and are causally related to many, if not all, of the same types of things that we are causally related to. There are therefore no good reasons to suppose that the new concepts and thoughts we come to grasp when we learn a natural language we don’t now know would lead us to question the objectivity of all our current thoughts. To make sense of there being true thoughts that are as alien to us as our thoughts are to the BIV while still accepting SE and CE, we would have to make sense of there being a practice of applying words and sentences to “objects” that cannot be described or individuated in terms of anything we can locate in space and time. If we take the causal constraint on reference, meaning, and thought content seriously, however, we have no resources for making sense of this. Skepticism about objectivity therefore appears to be without any content for a content externalist. (The argument sketched here is from Ebbs 1992: section XII. Different arguments for similar conclusions are presented in Putnam 1994; D. Davies 1997; and Button 2013: section 13.4.)

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