Song-Ming Confucianism

First published Thu Mar 19, 2020

Confucian thought in China’s Song (960–1279 CE), Yuan (1279–1368 CE), and Ming (1368–1644 CE) dynasties is marked by concerted efforts to weave the ideas expressed in traditional Confucian texts into more coherent and theoretical worldviews, and to make more explicit what its advocates and practitioners take to be the Confucian tradition’s metaphysics and moral psychology, and to refute and curtail the influence of Buddhism and Daoism. Many anthologies and histories of Chinese philosophy treat the Song-Ming period as second only to the classical, pre-Qin period in terms of its importance and influence on Confucian thought, with its two leading philosophers Zhu Xi (1130–1200) and Wang Yangming (1472–1529) doing the most to shape the tradition as we know it today. Most studies of this period focus on Confucians in the first and last of these dynasties, the Song and Ming. There were several notable Confucian philosophers in the middle Yuan dynasty as well, and the Yuan was also important for bringing state support and institutional backing to the orthodoxy of the Song philosopher Zhu Xi (Chen 2010: 241–274). But scholars tend to refer to Confucians of this period as “Song-Ming Confucians”, emphasizing the two most philosophically important dynasties and perhaps downplaying the relatively short-lived middle dynasty under Mongol rule.

The prominent figures in Song-Ming Confucianism held divergent and often mutually inconsistent views about each of the major issues of their era, but they participated in a shared discourse with a great deal of overlapping philosophical vocabulary and points of reference. Moreover they tended to treat certain issues as more central than others. Chief among these were questions about the sources of unity and order in the cosmos, moral aspects of human nature, how one’s subjective thoughts and feelings can and should align with (objective or less problematically subject-dependent) ethical norms, the methods and means of cultivating virtues, and the sort of institutions and character necessary for good governance. There were some areas of consensus. Confucians of this period tended to agree that the family is in various respects the primary locus of moral development and the expression of virtue. They also shared the view that human nature is fundamentally good, having well-formed capacities for virtue and being linked in some profound way to broader processes of life production and nurturance. Most regarded a certain body of classical Confucian texts as correct, including those they attributed to Confucius (Kongzi) and Mencius (Mengzi), although how much and in what ways one should defer to the authority of these texts was often contested.

1. Historical Context: Buddhism, Daoism, and Neo-Confucianism

Most of the leading Confucian thinkers in the Song, Yuan, and Ming dynasties are now described in English as Neo-Confucians, using a term of somewhat ambiguous scope and significance. In the broadest sense, “Neo-Confucian” refers to a thinker and practitioner of the Tang dynasty (618–907) or later who identified with and worked to revive Confucian values, beliefs, and practices after the rise of Buddhism in China. Construed more narrowly, “Neo-Confucian” refers to a subset of the above thinkers that belonged or traced much of their philosophical origins to an important group of Confucians in the 11th century. This group included Zhou Dunyi (1017–1073), Zhang Zai (1020–1077), and on some accounts Shao Yong (1011–1077), but the philosophers who loomed largest among them were the brothers Cheng Hao (1032–1085) and Cheng Yi (1033–1107). The Cheng brothers were most influential of this group, having explicated the metaphysics and techniques of mental discipline that they took to be implicit in Confucian texts and thereby positioning Confucianism as a direct and more formidable rival to Buddhism. Many of the Neo-Confucians who saw themselves as building on the tradition of the Cheng brothers identified with a movement known in Chinese as Daoxue 道學, “The Learning of the Way”, whose goal at the movement’s inception was to shift the emphasis of formal education away from literary attainments and refocus it on the moral Way (Dao 道) (Bol 2008). With a few notable exceptions in the late Ming dynasty, nearly all of the leading Confucian thinkers in the Song-Ming period were Neo-Confucians in both the broader and narrower senses: they sought to reestablish Confucianism after many generations of neglect; they saw learning the moral Way as the central aim of a proper education; and they were either in the 11th century group that included the Cheng brothers or identified with the Chengs’ lineage and teachings.

Most (but not all) of these philosophers saw Confucianism as being in competition with its popular rivals, Buddhism and Daoism. They thought core Confucian doctrines and practices incompatible with Buddhism and Daoism and regarded the latter two traditions as having an overall detrimental effect on Chinese society, accounting to a great extent for what they saw as a general decline in moral character and the dissolution of family and other social bonds. Even as the prominent Song-Ming Confucians sought to distinguish Confucianism from its rivals, however, the conceptual schemes and much of the philosophical vocabulary that they used were drawn from a broader philosophical and religious discourse in which Buddhist and Daoist ideas and terms were ubiquitous. Framing Confucian views in such terms helped to give them widespread respectability and currency among learned people. Furthermore, many of the influential Song-Ming Confucians dabbled in Buddhism before coming to align themselves with Confucianism. Consequently, the break from Buddhism and Daoism was not as clean as many believed, and it is useful to look not just at what they rejected but also at what they quietly and (mostly) inadvertently adopted from their rivals.

Although the Neo-Confucians took Buddhism and Daoism to be different traditions calling for different critiques, they nevertheless tended to see both as sharing some common defects. Perhaps the most far-reaching defect was that, as most Song-Ming Neo-Confucians saw it, Buddhists and Daoists thought personal liberation from suffering should take precedence over other aims and values, and believed they could only achieve this by extricating themselves from worldly entanglements, especially from human relationships and attachments to others (JSL 13.3–4, 13.14). They argued that putting liberation from one’s own suffering before other values is selfish (si 私), motivated by personal gain (li 利), and can be construed as endorsing a form of normative egoism (HNCSYS 1:3; JSL 13.1, 13.4, 13.6). Furthermore, by insisting on eliminating the desires and attachments required for human relationships, Buddhists and Daoists sacrificed important goods for the sake of transcendent ones, giving up their more obvious, this-worldly interests for more speculative ones whose attainment often depends on unsubstantiated theories of the afterlife (as for Buddhist nirvana or Daoist theories of immortality) (JSL 13.8, 13.10; HNCSYS 3:66, 22A:292; Graham 1992: 90–91).

To charge Buddhists with selfishness and egoism might appear to overlook some well-known features of Buddhist thought. The Buddhist Eightfold Path includes duties to help others and prohibitions against harming others. The path of the bodhisattva in Mahāyāna Buddhism includes a long, perhaps indefinite period in which the bodhisattva embodies and practices great compassion (daci 大慈) and commits to ending the suffering of all sentient life before entering nirvana herself or himself. Neo-Confucians were well aware of these aspects of Chinese Buddhism, so a charitable and historically informed reading of their criticisms should be more nuanced. One better way of understanding the charge of selfishness is that it describes what motivates most ordinary Buddhist practitioners in fact, not what motivates idealized practitioners in principle (HNCSYS 1:3; JSL 13.6). This would be a natural consequence of the fact that the Buddhist route to other-directed concern is considerably more demanding than the Confucian one, as care for others is more easily attained through ordinary interactions with family and members of one’s community than through radical nonattachment (Lu 1980: 16–21; Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 257–260). Another variant of the Neo-Confucian criticism is to suggest that subordinating ethics to soteriology has problematic implications. If all norms, including ethical ones, are justified to a significant degree by their contribution to one’s own quest to end personal suffering, this will give a different shape to very notion of goodness. Practices like donating to Buddhist shrines and maintaining a Buddhist diet can potentially be conceived as “good” (shan 善) without essential reference to improving other people’s lives or participating ably in human relationships (ZZYL 126:3033, Tiwald 2018a: 134–37).

Some Song-Ming Neo-Confucians also objected to what they saw as naïve Buddhist and Daoist views about how best to gain control over unruly intentions and feelings, leaning too heavily on meditative practice to solve problems better addressed through a combination of study, reflection, and the cultivation of respect or reverence (JSL 13.6; ZZYL 126:3019; Tiwald 2018a: 141–147). Finally, there was relatively widespread agreement among Confucians of this era that Buddhist metaphysics had gotten something fundamentally wrong about the ultimate nature of things. Buddhists in China often emphasized what they called the emptiness or voidness (kong 空) of all phenomenal things, which Neo-Confucians took to mean that such things are illusory and without value. This in turn was supposed to explain why Buddhists aimed to transcend the phenomenal world, for nothing of value could be gained by rearranging illusions (Fu 1986; JSL 13.12). In point of fact, this characterization elides many of the subtleties and variants of the Buddhist doctrine of emptiness, which Buddhists saw as consistent with caring about and acting to mitigate the phenomenal suffering of phenomenal entities. The influential Song Neo-Confucian Zhu Xi acknowledged as much, but seems to have believed that the transparently problematic conception of emptiness was the operative one in most Buddhist practices (ZZYL 126:3013; Cai 2009: 204–206; Fu 1986; Tiwald 2018a: 147–154).

Nevertheless and without question, there are prominent and fundamental views in Song-Ming Neo-Confucianism that bear the marks of Buddhist and Daoist influence. One is the Neo-Confucian account of the goodness of human nature. Many of the major Neo-Confucians of this period endorsed the view that the ethical predispositions in human nature are well-formed from birth, so that a great deal of the work of cultivating virtue was primarily a matter of recovering and eliminating the obstructions that prevent us from accessing that nature, especially selfish or self-centered desires and the various bad habits and biases that they present (Ivanhoe 2000). These philosophers took themselves to be expounding a doctrine of human nature found in the Mencius, but in fact Mencius seems to have thought that “human nature is good” (xingshan 性善) is true by virtue of the fact that human beings have a natural capacity or potential to become good, not that they are innately good or have well-formed ethical predispositions right from the start (Mencius 6A6, 6A8). A more likely source for the idea that we have well-formed predispositions innately is Chinese Buddhism, which had long held that humans (and all sentient beings) have at all times a kind of buddha-nature (foxing 佛性) or buddha-womb (in Sanskrit, tathāgatagarbha; in Chinese, rulai zang 如來藏) with fully-formed propensities to respond perfectly to its circumstances. Here too the well-formed nature is to be recovered or discovered by removing obstacles, which for Buddhists were seen as false and adventitious conceptualizations of things. Neo-Confucians even used or adapted many of the metaphors that Buddhists had long used to describe the circumstances in which our perfect nature becomes blocked, likening it to a pearl suspended in muddy water or a mirror covered with dust (Jorgensen 2018: 73–86; Z. Liu 2003).

Daoxue Confucians also adopted a technical term that had, by their time, long been used in Buddhist metaphysics to account for the ultimate nature and unity of things. This term was li 理 (Pattern, Principle), which the Buddhists sometimes characterized as emptiness and Neo-Confucians described as (or as a source or ground of) ceaseless life-generativity (sheng sheng bu xi 生生不息), understood as a system in which birth, growth, and procreation work in harmony to maintain the continuity of living things. Here again the Neo-Confucians took themselves to be elucidating an idea that they found in classical Confucian texts, but in fact there was very little mention of li in the classical canon, and even less that could plausibly be read as having the same metaphysical sense as the Neo-Confucians proposed (Dai 2009: 265–286; Ivanhoe 2002: 46–58; Makeham 2003b: 193–195). Other notable influences from both Buddhism and Daoism were a greater interest in meditation (Chan 1989: 255–270; Cai 2009: 195–197; Yang 2015) and a tendency to see self-abnegation or the elimination of desires as a major aim of self-cultivation. Some Neo-Confucians saw themselves as embracing a wider array of desires than their Daoist and Buddhist counterparts, but due in large part to the influence of Zhu Xi, many cut a relatively sharp distinction between what they saw as permissible desires consistent with the Pattern of ceaseless life-generativity and the impermissible desires as selfish ones (Chan 1989: 197–211). In so doing they ruled out a wider swath of desires than the classical Confucians probably intended (Tiwald 2012: 30–33). Add to these influences a wide array of shared conceptual frameworks, technical terms, and philosophical problematics and Song-Ming articulations of Confucianism become very difficult to disentangle from longstanding Buddhist and Daoist ways of thinking (Angle 2018; Araki 2008; Ivanhoe, 2002; Makeham 2018a; Ziporyn 2018).

2. Notable Figures

For much of the Song-Ming period, Confucian thought and textual studies were a significant part of the lives of most adult males who had a formal education. Those who wanted a career in government service were required to memorize and produce learned essays on the Confucian classics for their civil service exams, and scholarly discourse was replete with discussions of and allusions to Confucian thought. The Song-Ming period was thus a particularly vibrant one for Confucian philosophy. Two of the earliest intellectual histories of this period describe the lives and thought of more than two thousand Confucians who played some significant role in shaping the tradition (SYXA; MRXA). What follows is a brief description of the philosophers who loom largest. In most cases these are the thinkers who had the greatest influence on Neo-Confucianism, although we will also see some who, while less influential historically, now attract a great deal of scholarly interest for their originality or sophistication.

2.1 Neo-Confucians in the Northern Song (960–1127)

The philosophers often treated as founding figures of Neo-Confucianism are a group that lived in a period that came to be called the Northern Song (960–1127). This includes Zhou Dunyi (1017–1073), who produced a diagram and supplementary exposition that characterizes all phenomena as being governed by Taiji 太極 (variously translated as the Great Ultimate, Supreme Polarity, or the Supreme Pivot), a kind of ordering principle that explains the natural fluctuations of yin and yang or stillness and activity (Adler 2014). Another founding figure was Zhang Zai (1020–1077). Zhang developed influential ways of thinking about human nature and the cultivation of virtue, ones that account for variations of character in terms of varying qualities of qi 氣 (psychophysical energy, vital stuff). He also developed a metaphysics that conceived of individuals as part of a cosmic whole, related by nature to all other things as though members of a family or parts of the same body, and thus having family-like obligations to care for all others. One of his brief but stirring encapsulations of this view became perhaps the most famous inspirational essay in the Neo-Confucian tradition, called “The Western Inscription” as it had been written on the western wall of his study (Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 134–136).

At the center of this Northern Song group were the brothers Cheng Hao (1032–1085) and Cheng Yi (1033–1107), who studied with both Zhou and Zhang but developed their own systems of thought that came to be reflected in almost every area of Neo-Confucianism. The Chengs offered different metaphysical frameworks to account for Zhang Zai’s conception of all things as parts of a family-like or body-like whole, developed a sophisticated, multi-faceted moral psychology of the major virtues, honed Confucian objections to Buddhism and Daoism, and advanced distinctive theories of proper governance and administration (Graham 1992; Ivanhoe 2016: 24–48; Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 140–167). Some scholars also add to these four Northern Song Confucians a fifth founding figure, Shao Yong (1011–1077), best known for developing mathematical and numerological laws and maintaining that certain kinds of human subjectivity are incompatible with knowledge of things (Birdwhistell 1989; Wyatt 1996). Shao was also personally acquainted and dialogued with the Cheng brothers, although compared with the Chengs his writings show little direct concern with developing theories about virtue and personal cultivation. What became the most widely read anthology of the founders of Song Confucianism, a kind of textbook called Reflections on Things at Hand, omitted Shao in favor of the other four Northern Song masters (JSL). Three of these Northern Song thinkers—Zhang Zai, Cheng Hao, and Cheng Yi—were at times heavily involved in politics and became associated with the opposition to the famous minister and reformer Wang Anshi (1021–1086).

2.2 Zhu Xi (1130–1200)

By far the most influential Neo-Confucian philosopher is Zhu Xi (1130–1200). Zhu came to Confucianism after a little more than a decade of study of and experimentation with Daoism and Chan (Zen) Buddhism. Like many other prominent Confucian thinkers of his era, he was a great admirer of the Cheng brothers and took himself to be building on the exegetical and theoretical foundations that they had laid, although he occasionally registered disagreements with some of their remarks. In his day Zhu was just one among many prominent thinkers and teachers who claimed the mantle of the Cheng brothers, but by the end of the Song he came to be seen as the most authoritative spokesperson not just for the Chengs but for the entire Daoxue (Learning of the Way) tradition. His interpretation of the Confucian canon became the basis of the civil service examination in 1313, so that over time it was closely read by many millions of aspiring civil servants and students of Confucianism. Consequently, Zhu’s interpretation of the Confucian tradition has been treated by countless Confucians as orthodoxy, and continues to be so regarded by many adherents of Confucianism today.

There were few contemporary areas of inquiry that Zhu Xi did not touch. He made more explicit than any predecesor a certain metaphysical dualism of qi (vital stuff) and li (Pattern), which he then used to explain everything from human nature to the natural inclinations of plants to the acquisition of moral knowledge. He thought carefully and wrote extensively about methods of cultivating virtue, defending distinctive views both on big-picture issues like the role of speculation and book learning and on finer-grained matters such the purpose of doing chores and the proper attitude to adopt when reading. He also wrote at length about politics, history, and the art of administration and government service (Zhu 2019).

2.3 Wang Yangming (1472–1529)

After Zhu Xi, the second most influential Neo-Confucian philosopher is Wang Yangming (1472–1529). Wang spent his early years studying Buddhism and Daoism but eventually became an articulate and charismatic defender of Confucianism, one whose ideas and practices were honed over the course of an extraordinary career as a civil administrator and military general. By Wang’s time Zhu Xi’s views had become deeply embedded in the customs and institutions responsible for formal education, and Wang was trained in and well acquainted with those views. But Wang broke with orthodoxy on some fundamental issues, most notably on the role of personal experience and intuition in ethical cultivation and an alternative metaphysics that made the heartmind a constituent of the Patterns (li) that are the source of order and virtue. A guiding concern that ran through many of his objections had to do with the nature of moral knowledge or knowing, which he believed to be intrinsically related to the motivation to act, much as the desire to avoid a foul odor is intrinsically related to the understanding that the odor is foul. This had implications for the model of ethical cultivation which he promoted, which was to build on the immediate concerns and experiences of individuals rather than overly academic or scholastic study on topics well removed from their daily lives (Ivanhoe 2009: 99–184).

Wang also proposed that people have an innate faculty of moral understanding that he called liangzhi 良知, most literally translated as “pure knowledge” or “good knowledge” but sometimes more loosely translated as “innate knowledge” or “conscience”. If people fail to be virtuous, he proposed, this is because they are unable to access or recognize the deliverances of good knowledge due to interference by selfish desires, which arise from self-centered attachments and ways of thinking. This teaching, combined with his worries about forms of study that are too far removed from personal experience, conferred a somewhat ambiguous status on the longstanding Confucian practice of reading and reflecting on the Confucian classics, for it is not entirely clear why grasping ideas and accounts of events well removed from one’s own life should help to access or complement good knowledge (Ivanhoe 2002: 123–134). This and other ambiguities in Wang’s teachings left considerable room for debate among the subsequent generations of his disciples and followers (Peng 2003).

Later historians also noticed a number of striking resonances between Wang’s views and an earlier Neo-Confucian named Lu Xiangshan (1139–1193), who also spoke and wrote about a faculty of good knowledge and regarded the heartmind as a constituent of li (Pattern) (Ivanhoe 2009: 29–97). Because of the similarities between Lu and Wang, which in certain respect mirror similarities between Cheng Yi and Zhu Xi, it is customary among many scholars of Chinese philosophy to refer to two schools of thought in the Song-Ming period—the Cheng-Zhu school sometimes associated with the “Learning of Pattern” (Lixue 理學) and the Lu-Wang school often associated with the “Learning of Heartmind” (Xinxue 心學). This way of characterizing the two most influential poles of Neo-Confucian thought provides an historical lens through which many 20th and 21st century Confucian thinkers understand their own philosophical orientation and roots.

2.4 The Taizhou School (16th Century)

A group of thinkers that was frequently disparaged by many mainstream Neo-Confucians was the “Taizhou school” of Confucianism, named after the place in which its purported founder, Wang Gen (1483–1541), lived and taught. Although the philosophers most often identified with this school were an eclectic bunch, pedagogical connections to Wang Gen and some similarities in ideology and scholarly temperament make it convenient to group these thinkers together. Wang Gen and many of his disciples were distinguished by their commitment to the popularization of Confucianism. Wang Gen himself had studied with Wang Yangming and took seriously the idea that all people have innate capacities for moral knowledge and sagehood, capacities which, on his interpretation, do not depend on formal education and book learning to be accessed. Sagehood could be realized through the “everyday practices of the common people” (baixing riyong 百姓日用) and it was the mission of many Taizhou thinkers to bring this about. Taizhou Confucians also brooked more dramatic departures from Confucian orthodoxy and tended to see greater consonance between Confucianism, Daoism, and Buddhism (Peterson 1998: 723–732, 745–754; de Bary 1970: 157–171; MRXA 32.1a–7b).

In addition to Wang Gen, other notable philosophers associated with this school were Luo Rufang (1515–1588) and Li Zhi (1527–1602). Both thought the most authentic and reliably good expressions of our innate moral capacities were to be found in pre-socialized expressions of the heartmind, which Luo termed the “infant heartmind” and Li called the “child heartmind”. Li also maintained that the expressions of the child heartmind could be idiosyncratic, so that moral expectations and the shape of moral virtues would resist generalization to a much greater extent than most Confucians usually allowed (P. Lee 2012, 58–64; MRXA 34.3a–b, 34.16b–17a; Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 304–307). Luo and Li are now admired for defending women’s education, in part on the grounds of having equal capacity for virtue and wisdom. Luo proposed that women were more reliably virtuous than men and played the more fundamental and consequential role in the cultivation of virtue (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 172–179; Cheng 2001: 103–117; Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 297–304).

2.5 Outliers in the Song and Ming

Other than the Northern Song Neo-Confucians described in section 2.1, every philosopher mentioned heretofore has been a Neo-Confucian in the narrow sense associated with Daoxue (see section 1 on the differences between the broad and narrow senses of “Neo-Confucian”). That is, each has been someone who takes most of his cues from the Cheng brothers, most notably by adopting their robustly metaphysical accounts of human nature and the fundamental unity or oneness of things. But philosophers of this sort did not have a monopoly on Confucian discourse, and over the course of the roughly seven centuries of Song, Yuan, and Ming thought there were a number of talented and innovative Confucian philosophers at the borders or outside of these mainstreams.

A once-influential but now somewhat neglected set of philosophers in the Song dynasty are often associated with what is called the “Yongjia school” of Confucianism, named after the county in which some of its most prominent thinkers lived and taught at various points in their lives. The Yongjia Confucians had roots in the teachings of the Cheng brothers and Daoxue, but with the passage of time some of the leading thinkers came to see themselves as opponents of that tradition, in part because of their impatience with speculative metaphysics and their more practical orientation toward issues of governance and administration. Two of the most distinguished Confucians aligned with Yongjia were Chen Liang (1143–1194) and Ye Shi (1150–1223), both contemporaries and occasional interlocutors of Zhu Xi. Chen and Ye tended to measure public policies and moral practices in terms of their contributions to public welfare or general social benefit (li 利), a tendency that eventually led some 20th and 21st century historians to characterize Chen and Ye as “utilitarian” thinkers (Qi 1982: 1178–1187; Tillman 1982; Xiao 1982: 539). For both Chen and Ye, the rightness and desirability of a particular practice was determined by its consequences and not (or at least not directly) the agents’ motives and character. Chen and Ye also argued against accounts of the Way (Dao) that posited it as a timeless, abstract entity independent of concrete affairs and circumstances (Niu 1998; Tillman 1982).

Another maverick Confucian of this period was Wang Tingxiang (1474–1544). In opposition to the metaphysical dualists of his time, Wang proposed that the ordinary features and behaviors of qi (vital stuff) could account for everything in the cosmos, including the sources of order and creation that mainstream Neo-Confucians tended to identify with irreducible li (Patterns) (Ong 2006; Y. Liu 2000: 55–85). He also rejected the fundamental unity and oneness of the universe and—still more astonishingly—denied that a comprehensive unity was even desirable (Kim 2008; Ong 2006). And Wang furthermore took the decidedly unorthodox view that goodness and the predispositions for virtue aren’t necessary features of human nature, suggesting instead that the moral emotions that people often cited as evidence of natural goodness, such as moral shame, are primarily responsive to social norms and expectations (Ong 2006: 474). In taking this position he defied a centuries-old Confucian consensus about human nature that was rarely contradicted in the Song, Yuan, and Ming dynasties.

Perhaps the most fertile period for those who worked at the periphery of the main lines of Neo-Confucianism was five or six decades that spanned the collapse of the Ming and the consolidation of the Qing dynasty, roughly 1640 to 1700. Although this was a time of instability in some parts of China, it nevertheless witnessed declining faith in longstanding political customs as well as budding movements in Confucian scholarship that paved the way for more dramatic departures from orthodoxy. One such movement was the rise of “evidential studies” (kaozheng xue 考證學), understood as approaches to scholarship that lean more heavily on areas of study like astronomy, geography, mathematics, and especially philology. A leading scholar of evidential studies was Gu Yanwu (1613–1682), who established a reputation not just as a precocious philologist but also as a creative political reformer (Angle 2002: 89–93; Brown 2011; Gu 2017). Another remarkably original and prolific philosopher was Wang Fuzhi (1619–1692), who reconceived all of Neo-Confucian metaphysics and moral psychology, working against the prevailing dualism of li and qi and developing an account of the virtues that made considerably more room for human desires and emotions (J. Liu 2010, 2018: 157–179, 265–284; Cheng 1991). A third was Huang Zongxi (1610–1695), who wrote comprehensive intellectual histories of the Song, Yuan, and Ming dynasties and offered some of the most radical political reforms ever put forward by a traditional Confucian thinker, contending that scholars and ministers be permitted to criticize their ruler openly and proposing that a variety of procedural requirements be imposed on the deliberation and decision-making of the emperor (SYXA; MRXA; MYDFL; de Bary 2011). All of these philosophers (and especially Huang) completed significant portions of their work in the early years of the Qing dynasty, but they were products of the distinctive intellectual and social circumstances witnessed at the end of the Ming, when Confucian thinkers started to consider political reforms in earnest and began to doubt a great deal of what had, for centuries, passed for obvious truths about the Confucian canon.

3. Pattern (li)

One of the most notable differences between classical Confucianism and Neo-Confucianism in the Song-Ming period is the prominence of metaphysical speculation in the latter. Many Daoxue Confucians believed that providing an adequate account of the world required that we posit the existence of some things that are formless (xing er shang 形而上) and not readily apparent, the existence of which poses philosophical challenges. Most notably, these Confucians thought we needed something they called Pattern (li, also translated as “principle”) to account for order, unity, and the nature and content of the virtues. They also thought that Pattern is closely linked to human nature, and they were interested in explaining how human cognitive and emotional faculties—what they called the heartmind (xin 心, sometimes translated more simply as “heart” or as “mind”)—can come to recognize and respond appropriately to Pattern.

3.1 Pattern and Its Relationship to Qi

Most Confucians in the Song-Ming period believed that all phenomenal things and events are constituted of qi, a kind of vital, energetic material. But many doubted that qi alone could account for everything of significance about the phenomenal world. The world has a certain unity and order that they saw as highly valuable, evident in things such as the natural behaviors of plants and animals, and the way that seasons work cooperatively with living things (and with one another) to sustain and reproduce life. And human beings have certain capacities to understand and contribute to the order and unity of things, capacities that seem to be part of our natural endowment. Many Neo-Confucians thought that some further explanatory principle or ground was needed to account for this order, unity, and the natural capacities that help us make sense of them, and for this they appealed to the notion of Pattern (li).

The Chinese character translated here as “Pattern” is li, a term that appeared relatively rarely in classical Confucian texts but became ubiquitous in philosophical discourse well before the Song, by which time it was often used to refer to what might be called the underlying reality or ultimate nature of things. For many Buddhists, a thing’s Pattern was its inherent “emptiness”, which is to say, roughly, its lack of any intrinsic phenomenal qualities or essences. For Buddhists this helped to justify the view that phenomenal qualities or essences are illusory, merely conventional, or conferred by the larger whole. Most Song-Ming Neo-Confucians rejected this view. They agreed that all things have an underlying Pattern, but this Pattern is what they called ceaseless life-production or ceaseless life-generativity, not emptiness. And furthermore, this is a Pattern that all things share, so that they belong to a unified system of ceaseless life-generativity. So it is in the ultimate nature of things to participate in and contribute to these systems, which are characterized by birth, growth, and reproduction. Paradigmatic models of Pattern can be found in the cycles of birth, growth, and reproduction evident in the change of seasons, or the way that birth, growth, and reproduction serve as the central aims or the organizing principles of families.

Many Daoxue Confucians thought that Pattern can do certain explanatory work that qi cannot. Pattern explains why boats can only travel by water and carts only by land. Pattern explains why children are naturally inclined to love and serve their parents, and why things made of qi alternate between yin (passive) and yang (active) phases or states. And Pattern also has normative implications, accounting not just for children’s tendency to love and serve their parents, but also for the fact that it’s proper and virtuous for them to do so. Most recognized that these sorts of facts had much to do with the constituent qi in things as well, and a minority among the Song-Ming Confucians (e.g., Zhang Zai, Wang Tingxiang, and Wang Fuzhi) aimed to show that the features and tendencies of qi could fully explain some or all such facts (Kasoff 1984; Y. Liu 2000; Angle & Tiwald 2017: 36–38). But most thought that Pattern has some independent role in accounting for them, some explanatory power not strictly reducible to that of qi. Zhu Xi’s theories about the relationship of Pattern to qi changed over the course of his life, but on his mature and most influential view, Pattern is independent of qi in at least two senses. First, Zhu says that there is a sense in which Pattern is “prior” to qi. He makes clear that this is not a sort of temporal priority—it is not that Pattern exists first and then qi arises subsequently—but when we try to infer back to the origin or basis of things we should treat Pattern as prior or more fundamental (ZZYL 1:3). The specific implications of this are a matter of some speculation (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 38–40; Chen 1987: 3–29). A second sort of independence of Pattern is that it functions as a kind of director or “master” (zhu 主 or zai 宰) of qi. Zhu is careful to say that it does not intervene in affairs or directly act on qi, but it establishes rules which qi then follows of its own power (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 40–42).

3.2 Pattern and Nature

By the start of the Song dynasty, the Chinese character xing 性, which is usually translated as “nature” or “the nature”, had long been used to refer to important features of people and things that play a major role in defining what they are and determining how they ought to be. For much of the history of Confucian thought before the Song there had been a wide-ranging and generally unresolved debate about the moral character of human nature in particular, with Mencius famously arguing that human nature is good, Xunzi (c. 310–c. 221 BCE) contending that it is bad, and others defending various moderate and hybrid views (Tiwald 2016: 437–440). By the end of the 11th century, however, a consensus formed around a strong interpretation of the doctrine that people are good by nature, according to which people have well-formed moral dispositions and sensitivities innately and permanently. Cheng Yi developed the most influential formulation of this view. According to Cheng, humans necessarily have a good nature because humans necessarily have Pattern (li), which includes the tendencies toward life-generativity that all things share, and this Pattern is an essential and important feature of ourselves, determinative of what we are and how we ought to be. Cheng and later Neo-Confucians took his interpretation to be implicit in the works of the authoritative classical Confucians, especially Mencius, but it is evident that their interpretation was more radical than what Mencius in fact thought. Mencius is most plausibly read as endorsing the view that we are born with strong proclivities or sprouts of goodness which, if we are provided with a healthy upbringing, will naturally develop into virtues, and his primary concern was with the nature of humans in particular, not the nature of all living things (Mencius 2A6, 6A1–6, 6A8). Cheng Yi and most of the notable Neo-Confucians after him, however, thought we had well-formed dispositions and sensitivities right from the start, that these are ineradicable features of us, and that they are in fact universally shared, so that the nature in us is essentially the same as the nature in all things (Ivanhoe 2016: 36–48; Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 159, 166).

By locating our good nature in Pattern, however, Cheng Yi introduced new philosophical challenges. His view assumes that all human beings have Pattern at all times, and yet it is obvious that few if any human beings are good at all times, so there must be some way of explaining the pervasiveness of human moral failure. Furthermore, Pattern is shared by all beings, human or otherwise, so the nature that we identify with Pattern cannot by itself suffice to distinguish us from non-human things. Cheng’s response in brief was to posit a second sort of nature consisting of one’s endowment of qi, sometimes called the “material nature” or “the nature of one’s qi-constitution” (qizhi zhi xing 氣質之性). The nature that he identified with Pattern he called by various names, including “inherent nature” or “original nature” (benxing 本性), referring to our nature as it is when not distorted or altered by external stimuli, prior to the arousal of occurrent emotions. Both moral failure and differences in species or kind can be traced to differences in one’s qi-constitution. If human beings sometimes fail to be good and virtuous it is because of dark or turbid qi which prevents Pattern from expressing itself or responding correctly, and dark and turbid qi is ubiquitous. The configuration and quality of qi which constitutes a thing also determines the particular type or species it is (Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 166). This was a view that Zhu Xi came to both refine and popularize in his own writings and teachings (Ivanhoe 2000: 45–49; Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 170–178). But Zhu was reluctant to say that we literally have two separate natures, recommending instead that we have only one nature that can be described in different terms, as “inherent nature” when considered in terms of its intrinsic structure and as “material nature” when considering in terms of its interactions with qi (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 64–67).

3.3 Pattern and Heartmind

Xin “heartmind” is the locus of both thoughts and emotions as well as the faculty responsible for directing them properly. Confucians in the Song-Ming period took a great deal of philosophical interest in the nature, characteristics, and function of the heartmind, explications of which could help to identify and specify features of moral and epistemic virtues. One of the most contentious issues, however, had to do with the relation between heartmind and Pattern.

In broad brushstrokes, we could say that there are two clusters of philosophical concerns at work in much Confucian discussion of the relation between heartmind and Pattern in this era. First, many Confucians worried about developing systems of ethical norms too far removed from our actual psychological dispositions. So, for example, they criticized Mohists for their view that one should treat the welfare of all people as having an equal claim on them, no matter their relationship to oneself (e.g., whether a parent or a stranger), arguing that the ideal was so far removed from our natural tendencies as to be impossible (JSL 2.89, 13.2; CXL 93). Our ethical norms, they suggested, should be ones that we have a certain natural capacity to understand and embrace. A major reason for this is what has been called the “wholeheartedness criterion” for virtue: if someone has fully instantiated a particular virtue, it must be the case that the person embraces it completely and without any reluctance or countervailing desires (Tiwald 2018b: 179–183). Someone who cares for others grudgingly or with some reluctance cannot be fully humane or benevolent (ren 仁), for example. Many Confucians in the Song through Ming thought that the virtues worthy of our esteem were only those that we could potentially embrace in a wholehearted fashion, achieving a state sometimes called “sincerity” (cheng 誠) by the Cheng brothers and those who followed them (JSL 1.3; HNCSYS 6:92). By making the possibility of wholeheartedness a condition for esteeming something as a virtue, they tied their ethics even more closely to the heartmind that we happen to have. It is difficult enough to adopt practices that go against the grain of our natural dispositions. It is even more difficult to embrace them and enact them without reservation or regret.

Given the strong emphasis on wholeheartedness and the need to fully embrace the ethical norms that many Song-Ming Confucians promoted, some saw advantages in views that closely identified heartmind with Pattern. If a particular practice or character trait (e.g., filial piety) is correct by virtue of being a manifestation or expression of Pattern, and that practice or character trait is to be one that we could embrace wholeheartedly and naturally, we can explain how Pattern and our wholehearted potential converge by saying that Pattern shares a common source with or is even constituted by our heartminds. Several Confucian philosophers made this idea explicit. The most famous advocates for seeing heartmind as constitutive of Pattern are Lu Xiangshan and Wang Yangming, both of whom are often characterized as belonging to a special lineage or school of thought known as “Heartmind Learning” (Xinxue). Lu and Wang adopted this understanding of Pattern in part because they saw it as putting Confucian ethical norms within reach of people in their ordinary lives, and criticized more scholarly or bookish methods of grasping the Confucian Way, which they worried would never become sufficiently intuitive to embrace wholeheartedly or sincerely (Ivanhoe 2009). Even more radical views were developed by the so-called Taizhou Confucians like Wang Gen, Luo Rufang, and Li Zhi, who thought that the Confucian way should be so accessible to ordinary heartminds as to be intuitive even to people with little education or formal Confucian training (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 86–87, 106–108).

But there was a second set of concerns that tended to push against the temptation to say that heartmind is a constituent of Pattern. This had to do with the pernicious implications of subjectivist accounts of ethical norms. By the start of the Song, many of China’s laypeople adopted practices from Chan Buddhism (better known in the West as Zen Buddhism) and much of the intelligentsia were interested in Chan ideas. Chinese Buddhists in general took an interest in the ways that features of the seemingly objective world were actually dependent on (and constituted by) the minds or heartminds of subjects (DSQXL 575c-579c). And some Chan Buddhists openly embraced a way of life that seemed to countenance subjective whims or inclinations (Gregory 2002). This, at least, was a worry about Buddhism shared by Confucians in the Song-Ming period. Cheng Yi succinctly described the difference between Buddhist and Confucian ethics by suggesting that the former “based themselves on the heartmind” whereas Confucians “based themselves on Heaven” (Tian, the cosmos, the objective order) (HNCSYS 21b:274). Accordingly, it become something of a commonplace for some Confucians to accuse others of being too Buddhist, by which they often meant that the latter (more Buddhist) Confucians failed to establish standards of assessment sufficiently independent of subjective whim (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 72–88). This is a complaint that Zhu Xi often made about his contemporary Lu Xiangshan (ZZYL 104:2619–20, 124:2975–76; Zhu 2019: 148–150). Zhu preferred ways of characterizing the relation between heartmind and Pattern according to which the latter was largely independent of the former, and was careful to distinguish between phases or states of heartmind that appropriately tracked and reflected Pattern (called “the heartmind of the Way”, Daoxin 道心) and phases or states in which the heartmind imposed its own selfish or private desires and inclinations (called “the human heartmind”, renxin 人心). In making this distinction he followed Cheng Yi and took himself to be in direct opposition to Lu Xiangshan (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 83–86).

4. Self-Cultivation

For many of the Confucians who wrote in the Song-Ming period, the most important test of a philosophical system was whether it could provide or justify a good account of self-cultivation. It was widely accepted that most people were lacking in virtue. Debates about Pattern, qi, heartmind, and the foundations of ethics were often treated as being important insofar as they had implications for how we ought to improve ourselves (Ivanhoe 2016: 22–23).

4.1 Knowledge

Most Confucians took the Confucian canon to be authoritative and true. Texts like the Analects, the Mencius, and the Rites were required reading for any aspiring scholar and Confucians often appealed to these texts to substantiate their claims. But modern readers are sometimes surprised to learn that there was some debate about whether and to what extent reading the Confucian classics was required for proper self-development (Ivanhoe 2000). On the one hand, it seemed obvious to many Confucians that many people had the wrong views and the authoritative Confucian texts seemed the most obvious way to correct those views. On the other hand, some Confucians of this era worried that knowledge acquired from books couldn’t be obtained and internalized in ways required for wholehearted virtue (see section 3.3). Moreover, most agreed that we have well-formed ethical capacities by nature (section 3.2). Accordingly, philosophers like Lu Xiangshan and Wang Yangming thought we could rely more on our own intuitions or deeply-felt moral insights that come from daily life, and that these were often preferable to the more fragmentary and abstract types of study connected to book learning (CXL 49; Ivanhoe 2002: 77–80; Ivanhoe 2009: 34–39; Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 243–245). In contrast, Zhu Xi worried that intuitions were too unreliable, that we are too predisposed to rationalize or find clever ways of countenancing self-serving inclinations and judgments, and thought reading authoritative Confucian texts with an open mind and reverential attention a good way to check our self-serving biases (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 151–155; Chu 1990: 128–162; ZZYL 10–11).

Confucians in the Song-Ming period adopted from the Mencius a general framework for the acquisition of ethical knowledge, according to which there are certain paradigm scenarios or cases (e.g., when seeing a child about to fall into a well or when food is given with contempt) that elicit reliably good or virtuous responses, but many other cases which do not. As Mencius describes his goal there, the goal is to “extend” (tui 推) or expand the reliable ethical judgments and emotional responses from those paradigm scenarios to the new ones (Mencius 2A6, 6A10). In the Mencius that is done in part by noticing relevant similarities between cases, as when one sees that accepting a bribe for a special favor is self-debasing and shameful in ways similar to accepting food given with contempt, or the treatment due to seniors in general is similar to the respect we already give to our own elders (Mencius 1A7, 6A10; Van Norden 2007: 234–246). Confucians in the Song through Ming tend to characterize the acquisition of new moral knowledge similarly, often invoking the Mencian notion of “extension”. Zhu Xi adds that we acquire new moral knowledge in part by seeing how a rule or norm to which we should conform fits into a larger system of norms that sustain a system of mutual life-generativity (a system in which life, growth, and reproduction are ongoing and reciprocal). This is part of what he describes as discerning the “reasons why it is so” (suoyi ran zhi gu 所以然之故), and is necessary for a deeper understanding of rules or norms that we otherwise take on faith or confidence in the tradition (ZZYL 18:625; Angle & Tiwald 2017: 122–129).

Song-Ming Confucians were also interested in different kinds or types of knowledge. One oft-discussed distinction was between mere “ordinary knowledge” (changzhi 常知) and “genuine” or “true knowledge” (zhenzhi 真知). Ordinary knowledge is often portrayed as merely a correct and reliably informed affirmation that something is true or right, while genuine knowledge often requires some personal acquaintance with the matter, and necessarily issues in (or is constituted by) some appropriate feeling and motivation. In one influential discussion, Cheng Yi illustrates the distinction by describing two different sorts of reactions to news that a tiger was attacking people in the vicinity. Some villagers were startled but did not have the powerful, almost involuntary fear of the one farmer who had been wounded by a tiger in the past. Cheng suggests that ethical knowledge should have the same character as the survivor’s fear (HNCSYS 2a:16, 15:147; Graham 1992: 80). Wang Yangming later used this rough framework to argue for his famous thesis that knowledge and action are united (Chen 1991: 93–98; Ivanhoe 2000: 62–66; Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 266–268).

Many Confucians in the Daoxue (“Learning of the Way”) tradition also distinguished between “sensory knowledge” (wenjian zhi zhi 聞見之知) and the sort of knowledge that concerns or can be attributed to our virtuous nature (dexing zhi zhi 德性之知). These were distinguished in various ways by influential Daoxue Confucians. Zhang Zai thought that in the case of sensory knowledge, knowers always conceive the object of knowledge as external and separate from themselves, whereas in the latter sort of knowledge the knower and known are united. Zhang believed that sensory knowledge was both fallible and insufficient for many purposes (especially ethical purposes) but allowed that sensory knowledge is necessary as a means of acquiring knowledge of the virtuous nature, and perhaps also as providing warrants or justifications for the latter sort of knowledge (ZM 7:24–25; Angle & Tiwald 2017: 112–114; Zuo 2019). The Cheng brothers adamantly opposed the view that knowledge of the virtuous nature “depends on” sensory knowledge (HNCSYS 25:317). But they seemed to think that this pertained to certain kinds of dependence and not others, because they continued to recommend that people read texts and undertake investigations of external things and affairs (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 115–116). Some of the Cheng brothers’ immediate disciples entertained more explicitly innatist views of proper knowledge of the virtuous nature, suggesting that we find it solely through inward reflection and meditation (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 216–217). But Zhu Xi thought innate intuitions were unreliable and thus politely declined to make any hard-and-fast distinctions between the two kinds of knowledge (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 117–119). Zhu did, however, continue to think that the most transformative and motivational knowledge is in some sense knowledge of our own (virtuous) nature, whatever external means we may use to acquire it (ZZYL 10:161; Zhu 2019: 29).

4.2 Mental Discipline

Due in part to the influence of Buddhism, Confucians in the Song-Ming period were interested in the many ways in which subtle or hard-to-detect psychological dispositions and phenomena can hamper our ability to apprehend things clearly and correctly. Some thought that most or all instances of moral failure could be credited to an inflated sense of one’s own importance or self-centeredness (si), which manifests in selfish inclinations or desires that then lead us astray (Shun 2010: 185–187). Confucians in this era thus developed and argued about various techniques meant to help us detect and undercut selfish inclinations and desires, and other techniques which (much like Buddhist meditation) help quiet the mind so that it can respond to the world with more evenhandedness and equanimity.

The first set of techniques were concerned with detecting and eradicating selfish thoughts or inclinations, a task they sometimes characterized as (or as part of) “overcoming the self” (keji 克己). Many emphasized that it was most advantageous to look for these thoughts and inclinations in liminal moments of emotional incipience (ji 機), just as emotions are starting to enter consciousness but before they start to reshape other mental processes and dispositions (Smith et al. 1990: 190–199; Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 282). Most Confucians in the Song-Ming period endorsed this sort of self-monitoring, although some seemed to think that it played a more important role in self-cultivation than others. Wang Yangming was among those who thought it central and indispensable for the work of improving one’s character and state of heartmind, sometimes saying that our selfish inclinations needed to be pursued like robbers and thoroughly eradicated (CXL 39, 60, 279). In contrast, Zhu Xi saw self-monitoring as important but as somewhat less pervasively demanding than Wang. On his view, much of the work of self-monitoring becomes unnecessary if we fully realize or embody reverential attention (jing 敬). Zhu likened the work of overcoming the self to taking medicine for an illness: when one is in good health (instantiating proper reverential attention in all that one thinks about) then taking medicine (self-monitoring) is unnecessary (ZZYL 9:151–52; Angle & Tiwald 2017: 146).

Some Confucian debate in the Song-Ming period concerned the role of meditation in achieving mental stability and insight. The most popular form for Confucians was known as “quiet sitting” (jingzuo 靜坐), which many recommended as a way to achieve a state of quietude or tranquility (jing 靜). Some Daoxue Confucians thought that we discover our virtuous inherent nature when the heartmind is in this state of tranquility, a view most notably held by Yang Shi (1053–1135), a student of the Cheng brothers. Zhu Xi rejected this conception of meditation’s role in self-cultivation, maintaining that we cannot experience or perceive our virtuous nature directly but only indirectly through its responses to worldly events, requiring a state of activity and responsiveness which isn’t meditative (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 147–149). Nevertheless, Zhu thought quiet sitting played important supporting roles in developing one’s capacities of mental discipline. He believed it an important complement to study and reflection and suggested that for some people with particularly unruly heartminds it could be the most productive path to self-improvement (Chan 1989: 255–270).

Another objection to over-reliance on meditation was that it would leave its practitioners ill-equipped to handle the demands of active life, which (unlike quiet sitting) regularly tests our ability to maintain control of our feelings in the face of provocations. Feelings on the Confucian view should be both proportionate and responsive to the correct events (for example, we should react with moderate anger toward the moderate mistreatment of a friend and not react with fury to a minor, personal slight). For these purposes, Confucians suggested that reverential attention (jing 敬) is better suited to instill the right sort of self-control, one that they thought we could use in both passive and active states. Zhu Xi described reverential attention both as a kind of concentration or focus and as an attitude showing respect and humility, and thus capable of putting private concerns in proper perspective and keeping selfish desires in check. He also recommended using reverential attention when reading texts for ethical and philosophical insight (ZZYL 12; Chu 1990: 170–179; Zhu 2019: 28–32 and 49).

5. Virtue

In the Song, Yuan, and Ming dynasties, Confucians were interested in the nature and psychological structure of virtues, particularly the virtues concerned with fostering and upholding good human relationships. They saw their emphasis on the virtues of human relationships as distinguishing them from Daoists and Buddhists, insofar as the latter two groups tended to promote a concern with personal salvation (which struck some Confucians as slighting moral virtue) and with non-attachment (which many saw as incompatible with having meaningful human relationships).

There is a relatively strong consensus in this period that five virtues are most important, both in terms of the scope of human activity that they should regulate and in terms of their contribution to the virtuous person’s moral quality. The “Five Constant Virtues” or “Five Constants” (Wuchang 五常) were humaneness (ren 仁, sometimes translated as “benevolence” or “Goodness”), righteousness (yi 義), ritual propriety (li 禮, sometimes simply “propriety”), wisdom (zhi 智), and faithfulness (xin 信). The Confucians of this period often called attention to ways in which these particular virtues overlap, such that a person could not instantiate one without instantiating another (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 164–165). But they still tended to think of four of those virtues as having certain paradigmatic domains or situations where they were most manifest. Paradigm cases of humaneness are those in which one acts out of love or care to promote the interests of others, as when one helps or looks after a family member. Many Daoxue Confucians also describe this virtue movingly as one of “forming one body” with other people or with the cosmos more generally, which in turn requires that we see ourselves as extensions of others and vice-versa (Ivanhoe 2018: 58–73; Tiwald & Van Norden 2014: 140–141). Paradigm cases of righteousness are those in which someone refuses to violate prohibitions that would rightly be regarded as degrading or shameful, as when refusing an otherwise tempting bribe. Sometimes righteousness just has to do with ensuring a just distribution of goods according to merit or position. Clear cases of ritual propriety are those in which one performs a ritual with reverence. The Chinese character for “ritual” (li 禮), however, is of much broader scope than its English equivalent, covering nearly every social protocol which should be performed with a sense of respect, from weddings and funerals to greetings (e.g., bowing) and serving food and drink. Paradigm cases of wisdom include such things as understanding the other virtues (their characteristic motives and feelings), correctly assessing the quality of a person’s character (when choosing someone for an important post, for example), and knowing the best means by which to achieve virtuous ends. The fifth virtue, faithfulness, is best understood as the virtue of being committed to and guided by reality in a consistent and reliable way. Some Confucians were careful to say that the virtue in this fundamental sense does not have its own paradigmatic domain of activity—it regulates and supports all of the virtues, insofar they all require us to being attentive to what’s real and avoiding self-serving illusions that would otherwise get us off the hook (BXZY 47–82; Angle & Tiwald 2017: 160–163; Fuji 2011: 28–31).

A potential source of confusion arises from the fact that humaneness is sometimes used in a more fundamental and all-encompassing sense, where it refers not to the virtue of loving or caring about the welfare of others, but to the virtue of harmonizing with or fitting into a larger system of mutual life-generativity, understood as correctly participating in a system in which each person’s life contributes appropriately to the life of others (BXZY 70; Angle & Tiwald 2017: 162–163). Humaneness in this more fundamental sense does not necessarily need to be motivated by love or care—one can exhibit the virtue of harmonizing with the larger whole even while acting out of a sense of shame (as righteousness requires), or reverence (as ritual propriety requires). But there is a sense in which we exhibit the virtue of mutual life-generativity even when acting righteously or ritually proper. On an interpretation suggested by Zhu Xi, this is because all of the other virtues can be seen as getting their purpose and value from their part in contributing to mutual life-generativity, much as the life-production of the springtime gives purpose and value to the summer, autumn, and winter (ZZYL 20:694; Angle & Tiwald 2017: 166–167).

6. Governance

Throughout the Song-Ming period, mastery of Confucian texts was required for the civil service exams and thus for most appointments to state office. Confucianism had also long enjoyed a special prestige among bureaucrats and state officials, being seen by many as offering the best training for the skills and ethical demands of governance. Accordingly, many of the major Confucian philosophers and their interlocutors had experience with and were keenly interested in administration and state affairs. Most Confucians conceived of their obligations to the state as pulling in two directions: they saw loyalty to the hereditary monarchy as mandatory in most major respects, but they also regarded it as their duty to share the benefit of their ethical guidance and sound judgment with the emperor and authorities at every level. On one relatively prevalent understanding of that role, to both serve the emperor and provide him with ethical moorings was the highest form of loyalty, for it helped to sustain the rule and further consolidate its legitimacy as a successor regime to the Confucian sage-kings of old. At times, however, many Song-Ming Confucians lost confidence in the emperor and his court and sought to promote more decentralized forms of government with local and non-state institutions taking on a larger role (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 181–189).

6.1 Commanderies vs. Fiefdoms

One of the oft-revisited debates in the Song-Ming period had to do with the difficult matter of regional governance. By the start of the Song, regions outside the capital had been governed for many centuries by a relatively centralized and meritocratic system known as the “commandery system” (junxian 郡縣). According to the rules of this system, regional governors were to be selected from among those who had performed very well on the civil service exams, and they were appointed at the discretion of the emperor or his court. There were also restrictions that were meant to prevent governors from developing stronger loyalties to their local communities than the emperor. For example, governors were required to switch posts on a regular basis and were not appointed to districts that included their home towns.

Many Song-Ming Confucians recognized that the commandery system was too well entrenched to jettison without major conflict or upheaval. Still, this did not prevent some political thinkers from advocating for a putatively older and better system known as enfeoffment (fengjian 封建). Official Confucian histories suggested that this system had been in place at the time of the sage-kings, which suggested that it had succeeded in creating the high degree of social harmony and virtue that characterized that golden age. The most notable feature of the enfeoffment system was that regional governorships were inherited titles and thus treated as the hereditary rights and responsibilities of certain families (with some allowances to forcibly remove vicious or incompetent governors). But Confucian proponents of enfeoffment such as Zhang Zai and Hu Hong (1106–1161) saw a great deal to recommend it. By creating regional power bases, they suggested, the Chinese state would be more resilient and better able to survive when the emperor or his court were in disarray. They also thought that by having lasting, multi-generational relationships between local governors and their subjects they would help bring about more intimate and family-like relationships between governor and subject, thereby creating circumstances more conducive to social harmony and the cultivation of virtue. Finally, advocates like Zhang and Hu thought that the enfeoffment system could be paired with a legendary system of land distribution known as the well-field system, which guaranteed farming families relatively equal plots of land with relatively incontestable boundaries, all of which was meant to ensure greater equality for commoners and greater peace and accord in general (Angle & Tiwald 2017: 201–206).

6.2 Institutional vs. Character-Centered Theories of Governance

Confucian political thinkers in the Song-Ming period were preoccupied with many other contentious issues in the affairs of state and often argued vehemently over the powers and responsibilities of specific offices, famine relief policies, state rituals, laws and punishments, tax and lending policies, and military and foreign affairs (JSL 8–10; MYDFL; ZZYL 108–14; Zhu 2019: 56–71). Still, sometimes their disagreements about these issues stemmed from deeper disagreements about the role of virtue, talent, and institutional rules and incentives in effecting good governance. When the Confucians turned to consider these issues explicitly they often presented them as part of a debate about the relative importance of “institutional rules” (fa 法) as compared with “people” (ren 人) in good governance. In a well-known essay attributed to the classical Confucian Xunzi, the author framed this question in exactly those terms, arguing that good governance depends largely and more fundamentally on getting the right people, by which he meant people of talent and virtue. The chapter sums up this position in the succinct and memorable claim that “there are people who create order but no rules that create order” (Xunzi 12/57/3 [117]).

Most of the explicit debate about this issue was taken up after a series of attempts at dramatic reform at the tail end of the Northern Song associated with Wang Anshi and his successors. However well-conceived those reforms may have been in their own right, they coincided with a disastrous famine resulting in widespread debt and dislocation, and the last round of major reforms took place shortly before the Northern Song fell to Jurchen invaders. With that national anguish and humiliation serving as historical background for a great deal of political thought in the subsequent Southern Song, many political thinkers blamed the very attempt to improve governance through mere reform (rather than concomitant improvements in character) for the Northern Song’s downfall. Accordingly, most political thinkers were attracted to Xunzi’s position on the question of the relative importance of people (of good character) versus institutional rules. Zhu Xi articulates a version of this consensus position in some recorded remarks to his students:

This age suffers from two defects: defects in its institutional rules (fa) and defects in the current political situation. The defects in the rules can all be altered at once quite easily, but the defects in the current political situation all reside in people. How can they be changed when people go about their business with a selfish heartmind! The rules of the last eight years of Emperor Renzong’s reign can be considered defective. Wang Anshi changed them all soon after [becoming the emperor’s prime minister], but this only gave rise to numerous new defects. This is because people are hard to change. (ZZYL 108:2688; translation slightly modified from Zhu 2019: 62)

The view propounded by Zhu Xi and other character-centered theorists like Hu Hong seemed to allow that both decent institutional rules and virtuous state officials were required for good governance. But once the rules were decent, Zhu suggested, one could not expect to make further progress without improvements in character to ensure better implementation. Both Zhu Xi and Hu Hong also seemed to be struck by the idea that institutional rules have little causal responsibility in their own right and that it is much more to the credit and good judgment of virtuous people that they are used to good effect (Tiwald 2019).

Although the more character-centered view was generally more widely accepted by the most influential Song-Ming Confucians, there were some notable defenders of the position that institutional reforms alone could make improvements in governance. Two of these were the famous Yongjia Confucians noted in section 2.5, Chen Liang and Ye Shi. These two sought ways of improving the outcomes of policy and institutional changes without requiring more altruistic motives of people, and to some extent sought to redefine traditional virtues so that they could be more compatible with self-interest (Niu 1998; Tillman 1982). Another was the daring political reformer Huang Zongxi, who argued for institutional practices that continued to call for relatively good leaders but also created incentives to do some of the work that otherwise depended on the exceptional good will and conscientiousness of the emperor or state officials (Tiwald 2019: 86–92). Among other things, he proposed a stronger and more independent office of the prime minister or grand councilor, a rotational draft system for lower-level officials, and a requirement that the emperor attend academy debates in which local representatives could express their opinions relatively freely (MYDFL).

7. Influence

The Confucian thinkers of the Song-Ming period came in for a great deal of criticism in the centuries following the collapse of the Ming dynasty in 1644. Much of the innovative scholarship in the subsequent Qing dynasty (1644–1911) was conducted by Confucian scholars closely affiliated with “evidential studies”, who tended to see philosophers like Zhu Xi and Wang Yangming as too reliant on abstract speculation and personal introspection. As Chinese intellectuals began to take more interest in Western philosophy in the 19th and 20th centuries, some saw themselves as belonging to a tradition continuous with philosophers like Zhu and Wang, but others rejected Confucianism outright and Song-Ming Confucianism with it. Still, Zhu Xi stayed squarely at the center of the formal education system and the civil service exams right up to the early 20th century. And there is little question that Song-Ming Confucianism—especially the works of Zhu and Wang—continue to be tremendously influential in the late 20th and early 21st centuries. To this day, many people in East Asia who take a more scholarly approach to Confucianism regard Zhu’s interpretations as authoritative. Standard Chinese-language “readers” (duben 讀本) of the Confucian canon follow Zhu Xi’s interpretations closely (e.g., Xie 2003). Consequently, some of the popular treatments of classical Confucianism continue to adopt the terminology, conceptual frameworks, and philosophical vision of Zhu Xi even as they purport to provide interpretations of the tradition’s founding figures and texts. In the West it is not uncommon to find specialists in Confucian philosophy who work primarily or exclusively on classical texts such as the Analects or the Mencius, but for scholars of Confucianism in Chinese-speaking countries, many of the philosophical disputes are extensions of those found in the Song and Ming. The Chinese-speaking world’s most celebrated present-day philosophers are “New Confucians” (Xin rujia 新儒家), thinkers that take themselves to be continuing the work of the Song-Ming Confucians (M. Lee 2017; Makeham 2003a). The same is true for scholars of Confucianism throughout East Asia, due in part to the tremendous influence of Zhu Xi and Wang Yangming in Korea, Japan, and Vietnam. A great deal of current Confucian discourse in East Asia is framed as a matter of taking sides between competing lineages or factions of the Song and Ming, especially the Learning of Pattern (Lixue) school associated with Cheng Yi and Zhu Xi and the Learning of the Heartmind (Xinxue) school associated with Lu Xiangshan and Wang Yangming (Chen 2010).

In certain respects it is unsurprising that Song-Ming Confucianism has loomed so large in East Asian philosophy in the present day. The thinkers of the Song-Ming period did so much to add philosophical depth and systematicity to the more laconic and fragmentary Confucian canon, it thus understandable that the scholars who are themselves philosophers or looking for philosophy in the historical Confucian tradition would be drawn to its greatest systematizers.

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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

The discussion in this entry sometimes relies on work that appeared in a book co-authored with Stephen C. Angle. I am indebted to Steve for agreeing to let me make use of our joint work and for his tremendous contributions to my own understanding of the material. I also thank Steve, Philip J. Ivanhoe, Harvey Lederman, and Zuo Ya for comments on an earlier draft of this essay.

Copyright © 2020 by
Justin Tiwald <jtiwald@sfsu.edu>

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