Trans Philosophy

Trans philosophy is an emergent subfield of philosophy that concerns trans experiences, histories, cultural production, and politics. Through the lens of trans lives, the field reconsiders questions traditional to philosophy (e.g., questions of ontology, identity, knowledge, and power) and generates new questions that expand philosophy in multiple directions, especially enhancing our understanding of gender in relation to abolitionist movements, colonialism, disability, ecology, medicalization, law, misogyny, and violence. As with any philosophical subfield tethered to a marginalized community, trans philosophy offers a fundamental critique of philosophy as it has been traditionally practiced and, correlatively, offers new concepts and methods for the field. For trans philosophy, trans is not just a topic or an exotic puzzle. Trans modifies communities to which trans philosophy needs to be accountable. Trans is also a way of seeing the world and of engaging crossways and sideways with its (especially, but not only, cisheteronormative) discursive and material structures (that is, structures that privilege non-trans, non-queer people in advance). Tethered to trans communities and trans methods, trans philosophy is a critical project that is also an accountable and illuminative one.

Trans philosophy has developed as a critical project in the critical theory sense of the term. That is, trans philosophy is not merely a negative project of undoing or criticizing, in any simple sense, but is rather an illuminative project of identifying both conditions of possibility and pathways for alternative possibilities. Pressing far beyond the simplistic questions of “What is gender?” and “Is a trans woman a woman?” which have consumed much of philosophical inquiry around trans issues, trans philosophy sets to work exploring trans experiences themselves and how they intersect with institutional structures. On the one hand, experiential critique involves analyzing how we make sense of our worlds. It therefore plumbs, especially from a trans/feminist perspective, the epistemological, phenomenological, historical, and ontological quandaries of trans life. On the other hand, institutional critique involves analyzing how we intersect with social structures and their histories. Here, colonialism, the medical industrial complex, the prison industrial complex, juridical systems, global surveillance systems, capitalism, social reproduction, and law, as well as material structures of transphobic violence and erasure, all take center stage. Through the complementary vectors of experiential and institutional critique, trans philosophy has the capacity to illuminate the ins and outs of trans existence.

This entry begins by offering context and background for what “trans” means and how the term has developed in relationship with other gender categories (e.g., FTM, MTF, intersex, cisgender, and nonbinary) and gender norms (e.g., as formed by whiteness and ablebodymindedness). The entry then turns to offer metaphilosophical reflections on the nature of trans philosophy, followed by a brief history of it. The bulk of the entry is then spent sketching the practices of experiential and institutional critique central to the trans philosophical project. Finally, the entry closes with a rumination on the future of trans philosophy. The challenge of critique is not only to analyze and reimagine conditions of possibility, but also to put the inquirer and the inquiry itself into question. As it faces its future(s) and insofar as it is a critical project, trans philosophy will keep its epistemological methods, philosophical subjects, and, perhaps most importantly, itself open to reconsideration and reconstruction.

• 1. Context and Background
  • 1.1 Early Gender Wars
  • 1.2 Cisgender and Nonbinary
  • 1.3 Decolonizing Transgender
  • 1.4 The Trans/Disability Divide
• 2. What is Trans Philosophy?
  • 2.1 Metaphilosophy
  • 2.2 History of Trans Philosophy
• 3. Experiential Critique
  • 3.1 Trans/Feminism
  • 3.2 Trans Epistemology
  • 3.3 Trans Phenomenology
  • 3.4 Trans History, Trans Story
  • 3.5 Trans Metaphysics
• 4. Institutional Critique
  • 4.1 Coloniality of Gender
  • 4.2 Medicalization of Gender
  • 4.3 Trans Marxism and Materialism
  • 4.4 Transphobia and Trans Necropolitics
  • 4.5 Issues of Law and Policy
  • 4.6 Trans Ecology
• 5. Futures of Trans Philosophy
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Context and Background

Before one can have a clear understanding of what trans philosophy is, it is helpful to have an understanding of what “trans” is. According to a common trans studies’ definition, transgender refers to any “movement away from an assigned, unchosen gender position” and encompasses “any and all kinds of variation from gender norms and expectations” (Stryker 2008b: 19 [2017]). Already, however, philosophical questions arise. Can an English term from the mid-twentieth century be applied to all gender disruptors across eras and geographies? What, if anything, distinguishes everyday gender deviations from those exceptional or otherwise significant ones that seem to warrant the “trans” category? What differences does the term trans, and the category of transgender, illuminate and what does it hide? These are the kinds of questions that trans philosophy, as a truly critical project, is concerned with. Such concerns, however, are not new. The contestation of what trans means and what inquiries it can therefore circumscribe have been long in the making, stretching from early butch/FTM border wars and the womyn’s movement to the challenges that class, disability, and race, for example, pose to its defining contours.

1.1 Early Gender Wars

In the 1990s, the term trans expanded in a storm. From the start, trans people had to defend their relationship to established gender categories, especially of woman and lesbian. FTMs (female-to-male) transsexual and transgender people were typically considered traitors to those categories, while MTFs (male-to-female) were considered invaders. The larger trans exclusionary radical feminist context that fueled the Michigan Womyn’s Festival, as well as scholars Bernice Hausman (1995) and Janice Raymond (1979), informed leading feminist philosophers such as Claudia Card (1996). The simultaneous butch/FTM border wars put in question whether trans masculinity could be anything but patriarchal and problematic. The logic proceeded as follows. If, and insofar as, trans men are men (especially straight men), they have abandoned women and sided with the enemy. And if and insofar as trans women were born men (especially straight men), they are still on the side of the enemy and greedily presuming access to the category woman too. Whatever it meant to do feminist philosophy and queer philosophy, then, it did not mean to take trans experiences seriously as illuminative of the fundamental issues with which those subfields were concerned. Early work in queer and trans feminism (Halberstam 1998a, 1998b; Hale 1998; Prosser, 1998), stemming from the conviction that queer, trans, and feminist theory addressed the same troubling gender structures, began to turn this tide.

But the trans community had internal turmoil all its own. In the 1990s, self-described transvestites, cross-dressers, and transsexuals dominated trans organizing. In both cases, an increasingly purist set of standards governed who could count as trans and who could not. In the case of transvestites, for example, it was those who only dressed for pleasure and successfully passed when doing so, whereas in the case of transsexuals it was those who underwent genital reconstruction and hormone replacement therapy and successfully passed thereafter. Frustrated by those standards, a range of gender nonconforming people started to propose new terms for themselves, including bigender, intergender, metagender, third gender, transgender, etc. It was transgender that stuck. As conceptualized at the time, “transgender” did not require any specific set of practices, identifications, or embodiments in order for someone to count as “really” transgender (Stone 1987). Rather, it opened an umbrella space for a variety of kinds of gender deviance and gender play to collect and struggle together for trans liberation (Feinberg 1996: x). Of course, there is a danger of trans, as an Anglophone and US-centric term, colonizing all manner of gender disruptors it has no business claiming. In its best sense, trans welcomes anyone who would claim the term, but does not itself claim all those who could. It is a term of use, rather than definition, and a term of movement rather than essence.

At the time, “trans” was also entangled with the growing intersex movement (Chase 1998). From the 1990s onward, the case of John Money’s earlier intersex surgical interventions and gender reassignments fed discussion of (trans)gender experience (cf. Butler 2004b). The Intersex Society of North America (ISNA) (2008—see Other Internet Resources) insists, however, on a staunch distinction between trans and intersex people, a position some intersex studies scholars maintain (Karkazis 2008; Feder 2014). Other scholars and activists, however, including Banti Jaswal, Emi Koyama, and Pidgeon Pagonis, connect the two explicitly (Fausto-Sterling 2000 [2020]; Malatino 2019). The comparisons are myriad. Intersex people do not typically have a choice about surgery and treatment, whereas trans people do but often cannot get approved (Holmes 2008: 45–46; Dreger 1998: 261n80). Both trans and intersex people, however, and certainly trans intersex people, put the lie to the binary sex/gender system (Kessler 1998: 121–122). Both are subject to similar teratological narratives and processes of becoming (Malatino 2019, 2022), enough that Riki Wilkins, of Transexual Menace, suggested trans and intersex people meet on the grounds of menacing (Kessler 1998: 122). Both movements, moreover, have availed themselves of the framework of identity politics and coming-out narratives (Preves 2003: 88). Despite their divergent histories, theorizing trans and intersex coalitionally is an underdeveloped project and requires correlative philosophies of sex and gender, structural oppression and resistance, medicalization and bodily autonomy (Wolff, Rubin, & Swarr [eds.] 2022).

1.2 Cisgender and Nonbinary

As trans theory grew, debates about what “trans” means could expand beyond its relation to older terms and start to encompass terms generated within trans community. Since the 1990s, trans has been defined in contrast to cisgender and in an unsteady relationship with nonbinary. Coined in 1994 by biologist Dana Defosse, elucidated by activist Julia Serano in her 2007 Whipping Girl, and finally added to the Oxford English Dictionary in 2015, cisgender typically names the natural or universal non-trans category: “people who have only ever experienced their subconscious and physical sexes to be aligned” or whose sex and gender “match” (Serano 2007: 12; Enke 2012: 61). Similarly, cissexism and cisnormativity name the cultural ideology that normalizes cis gender and produces transphobia (Simakawa 2018). Canonized in Susan Stryker’s Transgender History (2008b) and continuously deployed today, the term cis has nevertheless been subject to critique for several reasons. First, it recentralizes assigned binary sex and the authority of medical-juridical determinations, thereby erasing intersex people from the outset (Viloria & Nieto 2020). Second, cisgender reinscribes the normativity of cisness, and therefore not only fails to account for the non-naturalness of becoming a man or a woman at all (cp. Beauvoir 1949 [2011]; Burke forthcoming) but also fails to critically interrogate the norms at work in transness (Enke 2012). Third, the term not only presumes the whiteness of the cisgender subject but may in fact require whiteness (Detournay 2019; Leo 2020; Bey 2022b). Fourth and finally, given its presumption of race, class, and ability norms, in addition to its presumption of gender passiveness and inheriting gender fully formed, it is unclear who, if anyone, can actually be cis (Enke 2012).

Nonbinary has followed a similar temporal arc. Nonbinary first took hold in the early 2000s as a term to refer to genders that are neither man nor woman, trans or otherwise, and have no intent to dismantle the trans category (S. Clare 2023). The term has increasingly been opposed, however, to trans or proffered as what comes after trans (Rajunov & Duane 2019; Dembroff 2018—see Other Internet Resources). If “trans” is understood (reductively) as crossing between two binary poles, then “nonbinary” would be a radicalization of trans, a leaping off the map as it were or at least off the line (Washburn & Fuqua 2023). Despite widespread uptake and resonance among gender disruptive people, the term has certain limitations to negotiate. First, nonbinary defines itself in relation to the binary (or “depends on a fragile juxtapositional logic” [Smilges 2023: 38]), a lexical fact that the related terms agender, genderqueer, neogender, neurogender, xenogender, and even enby avoid (Genderfluid Support 2019—see Other Internet Resources). Second, while many people use both trans and nonbinary as self-descriptions, the latter term, as theorized, often pits the trans and nonbinary community against itself, misreading trans people who do not use “nonbinary” as merely dupes of the binary gender system and erasing their gender resistance and creativity. Robin Dembroff, for example, argues that nonbinary “destabilize[s] the binary axis” while “trans binary” does not (2020a 3, 15–16). This position informs their argument that we are duty-bound not to use gender-specific pronouns “to refer to anyone”, despite gender-specific pronouns being a “beneficial resource for transgender persons” (read “trans binary”) (2018: 382). Marquis Bey similarly argues that (“binary”) trans people are “imprisoned” by their trans genders (2022b: 141). While the independent attribution of she/he pronouns is a “semiotic crime”, any attachment to them is suspect (2022b: 106, 58). Bey calls for the widespread practice of nonbinariness and they/them pronouns as part and parcel of abolishing (cis and trans) gender. Third, a comparatively apolitical term, in contrast to its predecessor genderqueer, nonbinary nevertheless functions, under neoliberal capitalism, to reify a three-tiered gender system of pronouns/genders on bureaucratic forms and legal paperwork, a fact that limits its ability to disrupt institutional processes of gender ascription and legitimation and further alienates trans and gender disruptive people who do not self-categorize as man, woman, or nonbinary (Amin 2022).

1.3 Decolonizing Transgender

With respect to who trans refers to, from its earliest inception it has aspired to name a broad swath of people past and present, here and elsewhere, who challenge Western gender norms of “man” and “woman”. This tack, which is taken by Leslie Feinberg’s Transgender Warriors (1996) and other works of its ilk, often explicitly extends transgender status to, for example, Indian hijras, Indigenous Two-Spirits, Filipino baklas, Samoan fa’afafines, Thai kathoeys, etc. Bakla Filipina b. binaohan (2014), however, among many others, has argued that such an extension is colonial in nature, taking a Western concept and applying it to non-Western embodiments in a way that erases their own, highly contextual gender creativity. A similar critique has been made by Indigenous peoples. People who use the term Two Spirit or Indigenous terms for gender nonconformity are not the same as, or reducible to, or capturable by trans (Driskill et al. 2011) and attempts to make it so are a product of colonial theorizing (Morgensen 2011). Gender disruptive or creative Indigenous peoples may have a non-trans sense not only of embodiment, but also of temporality, history, and belonging (Pyle 2018). From an Asian diasporic perspective, Chen and Kimoto have emphasized that Western, especially US-centric trans norms impinge upon and are insufficient for Asian trans masculinities and femininities (Chen 2010; Kimoto 2024). Chen has also explored the gender-disruptive promise of Pinyin’s pronoun ta in contrast to the English they. Indeed, whole gender histories are being overwritten by the global expansion of “trans”, a loss itself difficult to fathom. It is in this context that many have called for decolonizing and deglobalizing the term trans itself.

With respect to what trans refers to, or what transness itself means, a similar divide has formed. On the one hand, Black trans studies has argued that, insofar as blackness compromises the manhood and womanhood of Black people, blackness and transness are inseparable. This lineage begins with Hortense Spillers (2003), who theorized the “ungendering” of Black flesh under slavery, and continues through C. Riley Snorton (2017), Kai M. Green (2016), and Marquis Bey (2022a,b), each of whom in their own way has argued that ungendered flesh is, in some way, trans flesh (with the “trans” reference here partially loosed from transgender people). Conversely, gender and gendering is understood to be a product of settler colonialism and slavery. For Bey, all of those who fail gender and white coloniality can then access both transness and blackness (2022b: 72–73). This claim runs parallel to the inverse one that decolonization requires reconceptualizing gender itself as “always already trans” (Tudor 2021). “Trans” has elsewhere taken a different journey, however. Latinx studies, for example, which roots itself, first, not in the abyssal ontologies of US slavery but in gendered embodiments specific to Latin America, has generated significant critiques of the terms trans and transgender. While Latinx and Chicanx scholars (e.g., Ochoa 2014; Cuevas 2018; Galarte 2021) find in borderlands and border dwellers rich figurations that complement as much as re-comport “trans”, theorists such as Hija de Perra (2014) and PJ DiPietro (forthcoming), resonating with travesti theorists Lohana Berkins (2019) and Marlene Wayar (2019, 2024), argue that there is a virulent coloniality to trans and to transgender: the terms are undergirded by Western metaphysical assumptions (e.g., identity, sexual dimorphism, categorial logic, anthropocentrism, etc.), and they consume everything before and behind them, suppressing ontologies and embodiments specific to the Americas. For them, “trans” is not inherently a liberatory frame to be embraced but yet another dominant logic to be critically interrogated.

1.4 The Trans/Disability Divide

Trans accountable scholarship by and large shares one fundamental commitment: that transness is not a psychiatric illness. As such, trans experiences should not be pathologized and gender dysphoria (previously gender identity disorder) should be removed from the Diagnostic and Statistical Manual of Mental Disorders. Transness is a natural, healthy expression of human diversity. Indeed, in one of trans studies’ founding moments, Stryker (2006: 1) announces to an academic assembly, “I am not sick”. Arguably, trans philosophy has a similar founding moment. In “Evil Deceivers, Make Believers” (2007), Talia Bettcher elucidates the double bind trans people find themselves in, being taken either as gender frauds or gender fakes, living in a delusional world of their own fantasies. Contradicting the double bind, Bettcher argues that trans people have moral integrity and are real. They are mentally healthy, reasonable, and decent people. The no doubt unintended presumption here, however, is that neither trans people nor their transness would be real if they suffered from psychosis, PTSD, dissociation, or other breaks from reality. As such, there is a founding divide between trans and disability experiences and communities undergirding trans studies and trans philosophy, a divide that those same experiences and communities repeatedly trouble.

Trans and disability communities overlap in lived experience, with trans people being almost twice as likely to have a disability as their non-trans peers (Smith-Johnson 2022; Cavar & Baril 2022). Trans and disability communities also share deep histories of discrimination, criminalization, and objectification for being misfits and for having the wrong or non-normative bodies, disordered from the start (Wilkerson 2012). The everyday gawking to which they are subject, moreover, often becomes, in medical settings, an insistent need to cure and to fix, such that one might pass as not trans and/or not disabled (E. Clare 1999, 2003, 2017). Despite these experiential and historical intimacies and entanglements, there are structural forces that consistently drive a wedge between what would otherwise be grounds for solidarity. The systemic discrimination that consistently de-capacitates transgender people and de-genders disabled people leave these communities eager to defend their alignment with normal abilities and normative genders, respectively. When, against these forces, trans and disability communities resist the braid of compulsory ablebodymindedness and cisheterosexuality together, they do so in numerous ways, including reclaiming slurs (E. Clare 1999), advocating for access (physical, legal, social, linguistic) (Chess et al. 2008; Kafer 2013), negotiating passing and intra-community (in)visibilities, and generating crip- and trans- resistance tactics (Baril 2016; Thornton 2019). They come together in their pride at troubling the line.

The confluence of trans and disability communities prompts important questions about what (trans/)gender is when that (trans/)gender is disabled or crip. It invites us to think the gender nonconformity of madness and disability, as much as the madness and disability of gender non-conformity. And to think this as a critique of trans studies’—and perhaps also trans philosophy’s—longstanding investments in ableism, specifically its insistence that “trans” is natural and healthy, not a mental illness, psychiatric condition, or psychosomatic dysfunction (Awkward-Rich 2022). Cavar (2022) has coined the term transMadness to refer to

a wandering and wondering praxis, anticipating and refusing neurotypical, sane, cis supervision in both the structure of our thought(s) and in the comportment of our bodies.

Consider examples of terminology and temporality at this intersection. People situated in trans/mad communities are naming new genders: e.g., autigender, gendervague, neurogender, neuroqueer, and neurotrans (Smilges 2022). Terms like these insist that the landscape of gender and world be transed/cripped together. Moreover, against neoliberal capitalist demands for productive bodies (Puar 2017), demands which hide the circuities and elliptical excursions—or structural unproductivities—inherent to cisheteronormativity and ableism, trans/crip communities engage in “wastetime”, lagging, limping, and late time (Baril 2016, 2023; Thornton 2019; Adair 2022).

The challenge for trans philosophy going forward is to honor these many intimacies between trans and disability experiences, communities, and theories. In its quest for linear sense-making, in particular, trans philosophy ought also to value circuitous sense-unmaking—the unsteady and the mad. So attuned, trans philosophy will be better able to illuminate the nature of dis/order, the power of dis/epistemologies (Ben-Moshe 2018), and the concrete demands of trans/crip justice.

2. What is Trans Philosophy?

2.1 Metaphilosophy

As stated above, trans philosophy is philosophical work that is accountable to and illuminative of transgender experiences, histories, cultural productions, and politics (Zurn et al. 2024; Trans Philosophy Project [Other Internet Resources]). As such, it is rooted in the life and thought of trans and gender disruptive people. It necessarily attends to the ways in which trans and gender disruptive people have made meaning and community in a largely transphobic world and susses out the philosophical quandaries therein. While trans philosophical work has occurred since the 1990s, across analytic, continental, and pluralist traditions and in dialogue with trans studies, trans philosophy as an academic enterprise has coalesced in more recent years through the organizational work of transgender, travesti, Two Spirit, and gender disruptive people themselves, as well as their allies and friends. “Rich, living trans worlds are bursting into” the field of philosophy, Amy Marvin (2019a) writes,

resulting in an account of trans experience, concepts, metaphors, and understanding that is more informed about the complex endeavor of being trans in the world and its resulting politics.

In defining trans philosophy, Bettcher (2019b) insists it is not philosophizing about trans issues; it is philosophizing from and with trans lives. It does not place the margins under a microscope, but rather stands in the perplexities of the perimeter and gets to work. Trans philosophy is, fundamentally, a critical project and a grounded, collective endeavor.

Trans philosophy stands in stark contrast to several ways in which philosophy—largely in North America and Europe—takes up trans issues. First, and far too often, philosophy often studies trans life “objectively”, so to speak, as a mere intellectual problem, to be turned this way and that and reshelved when finished (Bettcher 2018—see Other Internet Resources). This style of philosophical work takes up trans life as a case study, or a thought experiment, on the way to some other philosophical point, whether about metaphysics, personal identity, or consciousness. Second, philosophy repeatedly considers trans issues in the absence of trans voices, literatures, and histories.^[1] Such work assumes that little, if any, true philosophical worth exists in trans people’s own sense-making practices (Hale 1997—see Other Internet Resources). Finally, philosophy has been used by trans-exclusionary feminists and their allies to develop and justify trans-exclusionary gender theory and public policy. This strand of philosophy does not aim to understand trans experience, but rather to defend the intellectual and political sanctity of an exclusive and hierarchical gender binary. Trans philosophy, as a distinctive practice, is committed to grappling with philosophical issues that arise in trans and gender disruptive life, as identified, characterized, and interpreted by those people themselves, in an effort to make greater conceptual and material room in the world, both within and beyond various dyadic gender structures.

Trans philosophy follows a long line of philosophies of difference—that is, philosophies that root their theoretical contributions in a people and a place, illuminating specific axes of difference and specific positionalities within larger systems of social (and epistemic) inequality. These philosophies of difference include (at least) Africana philosophy; Asian and Asian-American philosophy; Eastern philosophy; feminist philosophy; Indigenous philosophy; Afro-Latinx, Latinx, and Latin American philosophy; LGBT philosophy; philosophy of disability; and postcolonial and decolonial philosophy. Without presuming simplistic similitude, trans philosophy relies on conceptualizations of embodiment, history, identity, language, oppression, and resistance in those sibling projects. It also owes a clear debt to women of color feminist theorizations of standpoint epistemology, intersectionality, coalition-building, community accountability, and critiques of imperialism (cp. Allen 1986; Anzaldúa 1987; Collins 1990; Crenshaw 1991; Lugones 2003; Spivak 1999). Building on these foundational insights, trans philosophy at its best attends to trans voices while resisting the universalization of white, wealthy, able-bodied trans experience. It furthermore recognizes that its work is always already being done outside of philosophy departments and academic publication venues, and well outside of the Global North. In attending expressly to disability, race and ethnicity, poverty, community theorizing, and the Global South, trans philosophy has a chance of doing greater justice to the complexity and variability of gender disruptive and creative life.

Trans philosophy is a critical project insofar as it reprises certain elements of the critical tradition: (1) it analyzes the conditions of possibility for trans and gender disruptive experience, (2) it questions the social institutions and structures that most impinge on those lives, and (3) it is reflexive, allowing itself to be implicated and changed in the process. In a tradition typically rooted in Immanuel Kant, the Frankfurt School, and poststructuralism (Kant 1781; Horkheimer 1937; Foucault 1978/1990; Butler 2004), but which extends well beyond them to include especially feminist, African American, and Latin American traditions of critical praxis and struggle (Butler 1990, 2004a, 2004b; Gordon 2023; Mignolo 2011), critique attempts not only to understand how the state of things arose, but also to radically question it and risk one’s own subject formation in doing so. As a critical project, then, trans philosophy aspires to understand the conditions that make trans flourishing possible (or impossible), but it also works to ameliorate those conditions and support trans and gender disruptive people in their joys and struggles the world over. This work is necessarily grounded and placed, but it is also reflexive. It entails reckoning with the history of trans as a category that both illuminates and hides the realities it means to foreground. As such, trans philosophy undertakes experiential and institutional critiques among specific trans communities and social structures, but it also sets out to transform itself, submitting its own borders and boundaries—those it has inherited as much as those it has constructed—to critique as well.

2.2 History of Trans Philosophy

It is no simple task to locate the origin of trans life, let alone trans philosophy. The word transgender gained prominence in the early 1990s, referring to a broad swath of people who wander from the sex/gender they were assigned at birth (Stryker 2008b [2017]). Of course, this is only the most recent chapter of a long history of gender deviance and gender creativity (Feinberg 1996; Manion 2020). In this light, one history of trans philosophy might extend back to Butler’s Gender Trouble (1990) and Halberstam’s Female Masculinity (1998a) or to the gender transgressiveness of feminist philosophy itself or even to gender disruptive philosophers for several millennia. But the story is more complicated still. Contemporary trans philosophy and trans theorizing in multiple countries have differing genealogies, and a number of cultures have long traditions that defy and exceed gender binaries and norms. Thinking trans (and, indeed, non-trans gender disruptive life), as a deeply philosophical practice, is far from a unitary project, but spans multiple geographies, cultures, and histories, some newly emergent and some violently submerged. These differing and diasporic histories not only actively inform and critique what trans philosophy is and can (and cannot) be, but they demand a crucial practice of geopolitical accountability.

One way to tell the story of trans philosophy in the US is to begin in 2006 with the publication of the first Transgender Studies Reader (Stryker & Whittle 2006). Shortly thereafter, in 2009, Bettcher and Ann Garry edited a special issue of Hypatia on trans studies and feminist philosophy, while Laurie Shrage edited You’ve Changed: Sex Reassignment and Personal Identity.^[2] Including luminaries such as C. Jacob Hale, Cressida Heyes, Viviane Namaste, Gayle Salamon, and C. Riley Snorton, these two projects aimed to explore the “interaction” and “interplay” between trans studies and feminist philosophy. Following the publication of the Transgender Studies Reader 2 in 2013, trans philosophy coalesced as a spoken and written term in 2016 with the Trans* Experience in Philosophy Conference at University of Oregon and its aftermath (Zurn 2016—see Other Internet Resources).^[3] The Trans Philosophy Project was then established in 2018, funded by the American Philosophical Association and Hypatia. The field now has its first defining collection, Trans Philosophy (Zurn et al. 2024). It would be a mistake, however, to think that trans philosophy arose within the US only in the university and as an extension of already existing debates in feminist philosophy. As early trans philosophers testify, their work was rooted in trans community-building, trans activism, and interdisciplinary inquiry, such that trans philosophy was always already public philosophy and community theorizing (Zurn & Pitts 2020; Bettcher 2022; Zurn 2023). Moreover, it would also be a mistake to credit exclusively well-positioned trans and feminist philosophers for the advent of academic trans philosophy, when much of the theoretical and service work that made it possible was undertaken by graduate students, contingent scholars, and junior faculty (Adair, Awkward-Rich, & Marvin 2020).

Similar stories might be told of the rise of trans philosophy in Canada and the UK. Moreover, the philosophical roots of trans and travesti critique in Argentina developed in a parallel but distinct vein. As defined by Marlene Wayar (2019, 2024), the term travesti refers to a group of Latin American people who “de-identify” with manhood and womanhood, “break free” from the logic of sex/gender correspondence, and “construct” themselves otherwise. Philosophical work emerged from the grassroot struggles of trans, travesti, and transsexual activists such as Wayar, Nadia Echazú, Lohana Berkins, and Diana Sacayán, including their efforts to transform the legislative, representational, and institutional conditions for gender variant peoples across the country (De Mauro Rucovsky 2019; DiPietro forthcoming). It continues with the work of the Independent Chair in Trans* Studies at the University of Buenos Aires. Common to this work is a critique of the term trans, as well as trans theoretical discourse, as predominantly US-based and Global-North-centric. This critique is paired with a concomitant insistence that local lineages and embodiments of gender disruption and creativity be thought with at least as much care as “trans” lineages and embodiments (Radi 2019). Reflective of this turn, Lohana Berkins (2019), for example, asserts that something “gets lost” with the overemphasis or singular emphasis on “trans identity”. One of those things is non-identity-centric organizing, i.e., the transversality (transversalidad) or the transversal coalitions that, in fact, mobilize trans and travesti people in political resistance alongside a host of other marginalized groups (cf. DiPietro 2016).

At their roots, trans philosophy and travesti theory develop from the material precarity and local community of trans and non-trans gender disruptive people. As such, they require validating the epistemic authority and supporting the community struggles of those people. They also require grappling with the location of trans philosophical theorizing outside or at the edge of the white, Anglo- and Eurocentric norms of philosophy itself.

3. Experiential Critique

Trans philosophy begins with the recognition that there are trans issues to be illuminated through philosophical methods whose application is deeply informed by trans people themselves. This foundation stands in sharp distinction from the ways in which trans life is typically treated in academic and non-academic settings. As Marvin (2020) diagnoses it, trans people are typically subject to “curiotization”, which she defines as “the process of transfiguration into a curio” (194), or the ways in which trans people are objectified in the service of entertainment or scholarly interest. Perry Zurn (2021b) calls this the “spectacle-erasure formation” of curiosity, whereby an object is spectacularized while its subjective complexity is erased. To resist this force of curiotization, Zurn proposes that trans people’s own practices of curiosity—their own habits of way finding and meaning making—be not only recognized, but also honored as foundational components of any trans theory (2021a: 193). This has important implications for trans philosophizing. While some philosophers (even trans philosophers) make various arguments about trans people by appealing merely to some higher reason or reality (Dembroff 2020b; Burke 2022), trans philosophy proper requires more. It requires asking: How must trans knowledge, experience, history, and ontology be thought when trans and gender disruptive people themselves are acknowledged as theorists in their own right? That is, it requires a robust praxis of trans epistemology, trans phenomenology, trans genealogy, and trans metaphysics, a praxis often nourished by trans/feminism.

3.1 Trans/Feminism

Trans philosophy is not synonymous with philosophy of gender today, insofar as the former takes as thought’s generative ground what the latter currently takes as object of thought: (trans)gender experience. Trans philosophy is also not synonymous with feminist philosophy. However, insofar as trans philosophy is committed to conceptual illumination in the service of gender justice (and in resistance to gender oppression), trans philosophy is (at least) feminist in nature. And this should be no real surprise. Demographically, of course, some trans people are women, while some trans people break from womanhood, and all trans people are structurally subordinated by virtue of their genders. An attention to gender equity, thus, is germane to the territory. Conceptually, moreover, key terms and debates in feminist philosophy (e.g., embodiment, normative scripts, standpoint epistemology, intersectionality, sex vs. gender, nature vs. culture, etc.) have been crucial to the development of trans philosophy. It is only on the heels (or perhaps the shoulders) of feminist philosophers that trans philosophers can ask, for example, if and how “trans” is a gender, a personal identity, a political position, or a coalitional stance. It is, furthermore, in concert with feminism’s critique of patriarchy that trans philosophy can critique cisheteronormativity—a critique grounded, in both cases, in experience. All of that said, however, the relationship between feminism and trans theory, and more specifically between feminist and trans philosophy, has been a rocky one. Moving between coalitions and crises, their journey together is still unfinished. It is only possible here to recount some of the highlights of that history, highlights that set the stage for the projects of trans epistemology, phenomenology, genealogy, and metaphysics (for more, see Bettcher 2009a[2014]).

Trans exclusionary feminism and radical lesbianism, especially their recent reappearance in the form of “gender critical feminism”, is hardly the most noteworthy, or intellectually interesting, part of this history. While Sandy Stone’s landmark essay “The Empire Strikes Back” (1987), in which she proposes gender as genre and trans as a hybrid or in-between kind, was indeed written in response to radical feminist Raymond (1979), it was also written in the footsteps of Stone’s dissertation advisor: feminist science studies scholar Donna Haraway (1985). Of course, the idea that gender is not born but made can be traced back to Simone de Beauvoir (1949 [2011]) and forward to Judith Butler, whose theory of gender performativity was important for early trans theory (1990, 2004b). As time progressed, Butler was critiqued for overlooking actual trans life on the ground and the socio-cultural forces it resists (Prosser 1998; Namaste 2000). Subsequently, feminist attention has been given to (trans)gender’s embeddedness in the body (Salamon 2010; Heyes 2007; Scheman 2011), as well as its inflection in coloniality and slavery (see §1.3 above and §4.1 below). It has become incumbent to think not simply of feminist approaches to trans issues but of transfeminism, which is defined, by turns, as (1) trans perspectives on feminist issues, (2) trans women’s theorization for liberation, or (3) an intersectional movement addressing oppression faced by all gender minorities, especially trans and of color (Koyama 2003, 2006; Serano 2007; Enke 2012). Key terms in transfeminism, as understood in the latter sense, include intersectionality (Collins 2019), mestiza consciousness (Anzaldúa 1987), multiplicitous selves and worlds (Lugones 2003), transmisogyny (Serano 2007; Gill-Peterson 2024), transmasculinity and trans maladjustment (Awkward-Rich 2022), trans oppression/resistance (Bettcher 2014b), and ungendered flesh (Spillers 2003).

3.2 Trans Epistemology

Trans epistemology aims to understand the epistemic effects of transphobia and identify the epistemic resources of trans life. The first and most vibrant camp of trans epistemology, then, diagnoses the epistemic injustices sustained by trans communities, while the second develops the trans community’s own epistemic contributions to what and how we know. The epistemic injustices diagnosed are both unsurprising and yet unique. Like so many other marginalized communities, trans communities sustain a variety of testimonial and hermeneutic injustices, including de-legitimating stereotypes and knowledge subjugation (Fricker 2007; Stryker 2006; McKinnon 2014; Aultman 2016). The tactics of such injustices, however, are importantly specific to transgender experience itself. Trans people are repeatedly dismissed as evil deceivers or make believers with respect to their gender, as those who do not know ourselves let alone other things (Bettcher 2007, 2009b). Consigning trans people to the realm of “unknowers”, Blas Radi clarifies, involves “de-qualifying trans epistemic subjectivity” and “canceling [trans] epistemic authority” (2019: 52). Once categorized as unknowers, trans people can then simply be the object of dominant knowers and knowledge making practices, which historically involve exposure, dissection, objectification, fetishization, colonial appropriation, and instrumentalization (Namaste 2009; Raun 2014; Zurn 2021a; Radi 2019; Marvin 2020). Any antidote to such dominating epistemic practices, trans scholars and allies argue, must involve collaborating with trans people, honoring trans wisdom, using trans terms, and practicing a “respectful curiosity” (Hale 1997—see Other Internet Resources; Namaste 2009; Raun 2014).

But there is more to the trans epistemic story than unseating dominant knowledge structures and decentering gender normative people as knowers. A complementary component is trans people flourishing as knowers themselves, or, as Radi puts it, claiming a space at the banquet instead of being items on the menu (2019: 45). This requires a positive trans epistemology. This effort may include de-subjugating trans knowledges by building trans histories, theories, and vocabularies (Stryker 2006). It may include insisting on the importance of “the trans ordinary” and trans poetics as spaces in which meaning is made, rather than simply through oppression, violence, suffering, or sadness (Aultman 2019; Zurn forthcoming-a). It may include appreciating the precise ways in which trans people undo gender constructs, thereby making more epistemic room, especially through the disruption of gender attribution and the production of gender anomie (Nordmarken 2019). It may include resisting tropes like “the wrong body”, as well as generating new terminological frames, such as cisgender, and its derivatives cissexism, cisgenderism, cisnormativity, cistemic, ciscentric, etc. (Radi 2019; Serano 2007). Or it may include insisting on the specificity of trans knowledge-making practices (for which virtual environments and [in]visibility have been historically important factors), as well as their immense variability (due to their intersecting identities and social positions) (Nicolazzo 2021). The epistemic injustices perpetrated by trans knowers and trans studies themselves, however, remain to be deeply excavated and acknowledged. These include transmisogyny, trans ableism, trans masc occlusions, multiple racial hierarchies, a centering of the Global North, as well as elitism and prestige bias (Radi 2019: 44–46; Marvin 2024).

3.3 Trans Phenomenology

Trans epistemology’s commitment to centering trans knowledges invites practitioners to further analyze the present structures of trans experience and the structuring forces in trans life—or, to trans phenomenology and to trans critical phenomenology. As developed by Edmund Husserl (1913), Martin Heidegger (1927), Jean-Paul Sartre (1943), and Maurice Merleau-Ponty (1945), classical phenomenology aims to understand both what appears and how it appears. To do so, it brackets the “natural attitude” (i.e., common perceptions and common sense) and privileges, instead, first-person perception of the sensory world. Feminist and queer phenomenologies excavate the ways in which differently shaped and oriented bodies change the shape of experience (Ahmed 2006; Burke 2018). Trans phenomenology turns that attention to trans bodies, noting how the world is experienced by trans people in and through trans embodiment and dysphoria (Rubin 1998; Prosser 1998; Baldino 2015). A number of analytic distinctions arise from there. Drawing on Merleau-Ponty, Gayle Salamon (2010) argues that there is a disjunction—for all genders—between the corporeal body and the “felt” body (or the “body schema”). Turning to Heidegger, Das Janssen (2017) connects the individual and relational aspects of transgender experience with being-there (Dasein) and being-with (Mitsein). Furthermore, some strands of trans phenomenology also rely heavily on psychoanalysis (Prosser 1998; Salamon 2010; Stephano 2019; Stewart 2017).

Critical phenomenology, as the joining of critical theory and phenomenology, aims to understand how first-person experiences are shaped by contingent structures in the world (Guenther 2013; Burke 2020a). One might, for example, develop a critical phenomenology of transphobia, marking the ways in which transphobia, homophobia, racism, and ableism determine how bodies are made to appear—and to disappear—in courtrooms, schools, on the streets and in families (Salamon 2018). One might further explore the ways in which bodies, body parts, bodily gestures, and bodily habits are multiply coded in transphobic worlds and multiply recoded by trans-gressive individuals and communities, perhaps uniquely in trans of color communities (Kimoto 2018). While transphobia is an important locus of phenomenological attention, such attention can become more critical by marking the trans resistance practices—or, as Bettcher terms it, trans “discontent”—in and through which trans people experience and negotiate their world (2019a). Where there is a world, however, there are always already multiple worlds (Lugones 2003). Important extensions of trans critical phenomenological work address agender (or non-gendered) experience (Burke 2020b), trans of color experience (Kimoto 2018), phenomena at the intersection of trans-ness and disability (Awkward-Rich 2022), and experiences of home and homelessness among trans people (Gustafsson 2024). Ultimately, the project of trans phenomenology provides reflective strategies and attunements that unravel the many ways in which gender is constrained by the internal structures and institutional structuring of trans experience.

3.4 Trans History, Trans Story

Knowledge and experience—both trans and otherwise—are rooted in multiple histories and competing genealogies. Inherent in the critical task of analyzing how and what we know is the project of unpacking how we tell our stories. An important strand of trans theory—as expressed in life or argued in scholarship—resists the “trans narrative” that trans men were boys from the start, or trans women were girls from the start, or trans nonbinary people were misfitting from the start, and that they have always had an uncomplicated attachment to their current gender and pursued it with stereotypical social and medical transition techniques (e.g., changing name, pronouns, clothes, gender roles; taking hormones and undergoing surgery) (Spade 2013). In contrast to this narrative, trans people proliferate trans stories, weaving personal and collective histories of transing gender that honor the way gender disruptions and creations eddy across gender disruptors and creators themselves, leaving a complex and often unsteady subject in their wake.

Beyond the work of troubling stories of trans individuals lies the work of troubling trans histories. Against a presumption that trans experience arose with the adoption of the term transgender in the early 1990s US context, trans theorists and historians have begun to track the multiple histories of gender disruption and creativity in earlier eras, as well as in non-US and non-dominant US contexts. And while there is significant disagreement over how far the term trans can stretch historiographically (Manion 2020; LaFleur, Raskolnikov, & Kłosowska 2021), such efforts in trans genealogy provide significant opportunities to revisit basic questions in the philosophy of history, including the nature of (trans and non-trans) archives (Rawson 2009, 2015; Correa et al. 2019), the historiographical construction of (trans) origin stories, and the possibilities for thinking the (trans) present differently. Whether identifying the ways in which twenty-first century trans life is striated by economic precarity (Adair, Awkward-Rich, & Marvin 2020), biopolitical technologies (Preciado 2008 [2013], 2011 [2018]), or white neoliberalism (Gill-Peterson 2018); or exploring the imbrication of blackness and transness in the twentieth and nineteenth century (Snorton 2017); or recovering Indigenous conceptualizations of Two Spirit and gender variant people (Pyle 2018); or locating genders between and beyond man/woman at the heart of medieval life (DeVun 2021), the field of trans history and the philosophical questions it raises invite significant future work in trans philosophy.

3.5 Trans Metaphysics

In a world that consistently denies “realness” to trans people and their genders, trans metaphysics explores questions of social ontology and personal identity with the goal of situating transness in reality and as being real (Mock 2014). Over and over again, trans people are told, either explicitly or through the very structure of things, that their genders are fake (and dangerous) and that their true selves are not their trans selves but their original, sex-assigned-at-birth selves. Ontological questions are hurled at trans people as a way to police them: What are you? But what are you really? What body did God give you? What is your real gender? People working in trans metaphysics have the difficult task of rewiring basic assumptions about ontology and identity such that gender transition (and gender wandering) has substantial weight. What is the substance of gender such that transgender is substantial (or ontologically real)? How are trans people the same across transition and how are they different? How much of transness is determined by biological or social underpinnings, and how much of it is freely chosen? How real can a chosen gender be? Is the human defined by naturally occurring flesh or is there a fundamental (or originary) “madeness” to the human body, such that monstrosity, hybridity, and yes transness are germane rather than peripheral to it? These philosophical questions have been taken up from the early stages of trans philosophy and in dialogue with medicine, psychology, cognitive science, and science studies (Shrage 2009).

Unsurprisingly, perhaps, most of the recent energy in the area of trans metaphysics has focused on the question “what is gender” (Briggs & Dvorak 2023). As early as 1996, C. Jacob Hale exploded the category of “woman” into thirteen different characteristics, the set of which and each instance of which are neither necessary nor sufficient for womanhood. Importantly, Hale penned the piece from “an explicitly transsexual queer sex radical subject position” (Hypatia 1996: 189). Four years later, Sally Haslanger (2000) offered her definition of gender as genus, which categorizes men and women according to presumed reproductive function and within hierarchical social relation. Such genders, moreover, may be ascribed or conferred (Witt 2011; Ásta 2013). Early accounts of gender kinds, however, were not developed with trans people in mind or drawn from the work of trans theorists. Critics have insisted that externalist accounts (gender as externally perceived and constituted) need to take internalist accounts (gender as internally experienced and identified) more seriously (Jenkins 2016, 2018; Andler 2017). More recently, moreover, critical gender kinds have been proposed, i.e., genders such as genderqueer and nonbinary, which are not only socially constructed and internally assessed but also, and more importantly, positioned critically against inherited norms (Dembroff 2020a). More recently, Katharine Jenkins has argued that there are hegemonic gender kinds (informed by largescale patterns of privilege and subordination), interpersonal gender kinds (produced and sustained in smallscale social interactions), and identity gender kinds (which reflect the ways people experientially categorize themselves) (Jenkins 2023). Still, debate continues. External ascriptions of gender are arguably not truth claims but ways of organizing social space (Kukla & Lance 2023). Internal assessment of gender identity is arguably a cisnormative concept; trans people simply have (rather than “identify with”) the genders they define and describe (Saketopoulou & Pellegrini 2023; Cull 2024; Hernandez & Bell forthcoming). That having of a gender, moreover, may have less to do with positioning oneself in a taxonomy than feeling one’s way into a phenomenology (Briggs & Dvorak 2023). Further work in trans metaphysics, with a clear connection to trans and gender expansive communities, may be able to resolve some of these tensions.

4. Institutional Critique

While experiential critique is necessary for the illumination of trans experiences, histories, politics, and cultural production, it is not sufficient; institutional critique affords a crucial supplement. Structures of experience are, after all, formed and informed by institutions—which is to say that social organizations structure the contours and conditions of life as lived. Those social organizations, moreover, have grown and replicated within the soil of cisheteronormativity; as such, one of trans philosophy’s tasks is to critically interrogate their loud discursive pronouncements as much as their silent material effects. To date, the bulk of this work has focused on the institutional sites of colonialism, medical industrialization, capitalism, law, and policy, as well as the institutionalization of transphobia. Critique requires not simply cognizing the conditions that make the present structures and effects of institutions possible, however; it also requires the exploration of adjacent possibilities. In what directions ought, then, institutional critique in trans philosophy to move? A critical trans politics, as defined by Dean Spade, requires more than securing trans and gender disruptive/creative people recognition and ameliorating institutions on their behalf. Balking at aspirations to inclusion, critical trans politics instead insists on the transformation of the very logics upon which “state, civil society, security, and social equality” are founded (2011 [2015: 1]). It aims not to secure reforms that ultimately continue to consign our community (and especially our most vulnerable) to violence and suffering, but rather to advance deep and lasting change through liberatory practices (2011[2015: 2]). Insofar as trans philosophy works within the tradition of critical trans politics, then, its critiques of institutional life will extend to the recommendation of practices of resistance and imagination.

4.1 Coloniality of Gender

Insofar as trans philosophy has developed in colonized worlds, where extractive institutions have long held sway, one of the subjects of its critique is colonialism itself. Increasingly, certain strands of trans studies and, in turn, trans philosophy, have taken María Lugones’ diagnosis of “the coloniality of gender” as a foundational tenet of sorts. Across multiple essays (2007, 2008, 2010, 2012, 2020), Lugones developed her account of the “modern/colonial gender system”, according to which gender refers to a sexual dimorphism that is expressed via white bourgeois categories of man and woman. In its first iteration, Lugones’ locution leaves it unclear if gender predated (post-Medieval) European colonialism (e.g., she refers to Indigenous “third genders”) or if gender itself originated with (post-Medieval) European colonialism. In its later iterations, Lugones is quite clear that gender—by which she means the atomic, homogenous, separable categories “man” and “woman” which obey categorial, dichotomous, and hierarchical logic—belongs to and originates with (post-Medieval) European colonial power. Lugones argues that, through colonization, colonized peoples are attributed sex, but not gender. This is to say that peoples colonized during this period are categorized as males or females in a dehumanized, animalized sense but they are “non-gendered,” an assertion reminiscent of Spillers’ “ungendered” (Lugones 2010: 743; 2012: 73; Spillers 2003: 68). “No women are colonized”, Lugones baldly insists, “no colonized females are women” (2010: 745; 2012: 75). Ultimately, “gender is a colonial imposition”, she concludes (2010: 748; 2012: 78) that is always denied to colonized peoples (if also enforced on them). As such, Lugones renounces the longstanding coalitional term women of color and embraces instead decolonial feminism.

Lugones’ account opens a series of questions central to trans philosophy. First, given Lugones’ definition of gender, we must ask if in fact gender refers properly to binary gender categories or if it can (and how might it) refer to something else? Does (binary) gender originate in (post-Medieval) European colonization of the Americas, and what is its relationship to a much earlier (often crusading) Christianity and other religious investments in gender difference? What has happened (and what might happen) to gender in the fractures of colonial institutions? And what does it mean to decolonize gender? Second, given that Lugones did not generate her account from within trans community and history, we must ask where trans, Two Spirit, and gender variant people stand in relation to the coloniality of gender. “Gender does not travel away from colonial modernity”, Lugones writes (2010: 746). Critic Brooklyn Leo (2020), however, insists that gender variant colonized peoples have, repeatedly, traveled away from colonial genders, thereby opening up new possibilities for flesh and world. Surely this is also true of gender variant peoples within Europe itself—a possibility neither Lugones nor Leo acknowledge. Colonial genders are always already being undone from without and from within. Third, insofar as trans and transgender are Canadian and US-centric terms which have been exported to apply to all gender variant peoples across history and the globe, must we not also reckon with the coloniality of transgender (binaohan 2014; DiPietro forthcoming)? From one vantage point, transness frustrates whiteness/coloniality, and participates in a decolonial, liberatory project. From another, transness participates in a colonial consolidation of gender variance, identity, language, and history that itself suppresses, if not actively erases, rich alternative conceptualizations and practices of being embodied otherwise.

4.2 Medicalization of Gender

Another crucial site of institutional critique for trans philosophy is the medicalization of gender, especially through what has come to be called the medical industrial complex. Early critique of trans life (Raymond 1979; Hausman 1995), for example, cast trans people as dupes of the medical establishment (think medical transition icons Christine Jorgensen or Loren Cameron). Trans people have long been critical, however, of the medical, psychiatric, and psychological oversight required to receive sex reassignment surgery and hormone replacement therapy. Such a critique first requires analyzing the social structures that condition doctors, clinics, and hospitals offering said resources to gate-keep for patients of a certain class and, especially quite early on, patients who were most likely to pass as cisgender post-treatment. Second, it requires analyzing the terminology inherited from psychiatry, such as gender identity, disorder, and dysphoria, and their effects on and within trans communities. Third, it requires deconstructing the normative trans narratives generated within, circulated through, and policed by medical and psychiatric practitioners (e.g., that I have always felt like, always wanted, always been, etc.). At a global and transnational level, such a critique also requires reckoning with the ways in which trans medicine (and the ideals of trans embodiment it supports) often enforces racist and ableist norms (Pitts 2024). Those norms also help produce “less suspicious” trans subjects, less likely to trigger a surveillance system trained to register anomalies, itself part of a racial and security project (Beauchamp 2019). Finally, it requires tracking these medical processes (not only surgery and hormones, but clothing, gear, and reproductive options) around the globe and noting their complicity with colonialism (Aizura 2018).

There are, of course, other models of trans subjectivity, and other relationships to body experimentation, that are not reducible to normative models of medical transition. Narratives have long circulated within trans communities, especially in early transgender theorizing, autobiographies, and creative projects, of the cyborg, the monster, the extra-terrestrial, the hybrid, the mestiza, the border denizen, the gender outlaw, the gendernaut, etc. (Haraway 1985; Anzaldúa 1987; Bornstein 1994; Stryker 1994). These narratives offer a counterpoint to the medicalized discourse of becoming an identifiable woman or an identifiable man. They capitalize on a truth at the heart of trans and that is not its categorical destination but its disruptive journey. Some interpretations of trans people, especially of what are being termed “binary trans” people today, collapse trans people into simply new women or men, erasing the disruption (and radical revolution) of their movement itself. Early trans narratives that emphasize the do-it-yourself pastiche of gender transition (Gill-Peterson 2022), the basic constructedness of the human body (Stone 1987; Preciado 2008 [2013], 2011 [2018]; Malatino 2024), and the unstable temporality of trans becoming resist this bent (Spade 2013; Malatino 2019). So, too, do more recent accounts of trans ecologies (Hayward 2008, 2010; see also section 4.6), or neogenders and xenogenders that appeal to realist and mythical flora, fauna, and celestial bodies as models of the gender disruptive creature. These and other narratives refuse to bow to medical normalization, and instead use medicine, prosthetics, textiles, affects, and gestures to explore non-normative forms of gendered embodiment.

4.3 Trans Marxism and Materialism

Trans Marxism, as developed by Leslie Feinberg (1998), Jordy Rosenberg (2021), Jules Gleeson and Elle O’Rouke (2021a), McKenzie Wark (2020, 2023), and others, is the jointure of trans theory and Marxist politics. It takes a historical materialist approach to class struggle and social reproduction, especially as it relates to non-normative genders. Such an approach requires attending to gender non-conformity in a capitalist context. How does the Western gender binary system coincide with wealth and specifically a ruling bourgeois class? And how does the perpetuation of that class inform rates of trans labor alienation, employment discrimination, poverty, incarceration and institutionalization, and exposure to environmental hazards? What are the conditions of trans wage labor (from tech to sex work), but also trans unwaged labor such as affective labor and care work? How does economic austerity affect trans communities differently? Of course, granting that “trans” participates in, as much as resists, the political economy in which it sits, it is equally important to ask how, where, and when trans life has become a capitalist commodity, something marketable and productive for specific institutions and political factions. What are the modes of production—and exploitation—that mark the hormone/pharmaceutical industry, the gender clinic, as well as the global circuit of trans healthcare and trans aesthetics? In the academic context, how has trans studies’ educational elitism, division of intellectual labor, and reproduction of trans knowledges sustained capitalist feelings, attachments, and forms of organization? And what does revolutionary organizing look like in this context? What does it mean for trans people and communities to lean into the unproductivity of their bodies, the value generated in community, and the disordered structures of queer and trans sociality (O’Brien 2023)?

Important work is also being done to connect trans theory with the materialism of Gilles Deleuze and Felix Guattari. From its inception, trans studies has drawn key theoretical resources from Deleuze and Guattari (1972 [1983], 1972 [1987]) such as “deterritorialization”, the “molar” and “molecular”, and “schizoanalysis”, to name just a few (Stryker 2008a). In recent years, through the work of Ciara Cremin (2017, 2021, 2022), Mat Fournier (2014, 2022), Abraham Weil (2022), Jasbir Puar (2017), Lucas Crawford (2015), and others, that early riffing has deepened into sustained theorization. First, the body has been and continues to be “territorialized” by norms of gender and sexuality: this body part means X and must only be used in Y ways with Z person(s). Much like queerness, transness has the potential to “deterritorialize” the body, or rearrange what body parts mean, how they are used, with whom, and even what they actually are. Second, gender can be understood at the molar level (or the level of Being) as “gender identity”, but it can also, and more usefully, be understood at the molecular level (or the level of Becoming). From this vantage point, transness is not so much a definable thing as it is a structure of variability. Finally, schizoanalysis aims to replace binarism with heterogeneity. From this vantage point, a problem, a question, a group, or a project is always becoming more complex—and therefore open to continual renewal and recreation. As such, some have interpreted the project of trans theory—and by extension trans philosophy—to be schizoanalytic, frustrating the binaristic normative scripts, rooted in capitalism, patriarchy, and ableism, and opening up possibilities for greater heterogeneity and complexity.

4.4 Transphobia and Trans Necropolitics

Although it is not an institution itself, transphobia can become so sedimented within institutions as to structure their discourses and material functions. But what is transphobia to begin with? While definitions vary, outlines largely coalesce. Transphobia may refer to negative attitudes individual people hold toward trans people, or it may refer to the social structures that systematically disadvantage trans people. As such, transphobia is an individual and collective comportment (Bettcher 2014a). Harms happens to trans people qua trans people. Transphobia fuels these actualized harms, as much as the harms that hang in the air—harms that could happen at any moment, under the right conditions. There are transphobic feelings (e.g., unsettledness, heebee-jeebees, disgust, or hatred when met with a trans person) and there are transphobic beliefs (e.g., that trans people are morally wrong, “mentally sick”, or socially dangerous). Whether fueled by feelings or beliefs, transphobia arguably stems from a conviction that gender presentation ought to align with and, in fact, flag one’s birth sex (Bettcher 2007, forthcoming). It may also involve a perception of transgressive gender presentation as inherently aggressive, as if it were thrown around or thrown in your face. As such, transphobia is a comportment that attaches to comportment—to gender non-normative steps, swishes, and stomp-shuffles (Salamon 2018). Individually, it may produce looking away, verbal harassment, physical assault, and even murder. Socially, it may produce binary restrooms, M and F registration forms, and medical malpractice, and have the effect of increasing trans dropout rates, poverty, and sex work. Transphobia is also inextricable from the settler colonial, racist, and (endo)sexist systems undergirding gender enforcement today (Bettcher 2007, forthcoming). While transphobia hammers away at many people, trans and non-trans people included, however, they are chipping away at it in turn (Ahmed 2016).

While there is a kind of violence done to trans life that involves expulsion or outright abuse, there is another kind of violence done that involves surveillance and use. Building on Michel Foucault’s claim that “visibility is a trap” (1975 [1977: 200]), trans theorists explore the ways in which trans visibility, too, can be a trap. Representation is no simple sign of social progress toward trans inclusion. The coincidence of the “trans tipping point” (Time Magazine 2014) and continuously heightening anti-trans violence and legislation cannot be ignored. Indeed, there is a fundamental contradiction within “trans visibility” (Gossett, Stanley, & Burton 2017a: xix). While affording greater representation, trans visibility also folds trans people more deeply into the social structures that condition their lives (i.e., biopolitics) and put their deaths in the service of state power (i.e., necropolitics). Increased representation involves increased surveillance; and increased recognition involves increased capture. As C. Riley Snorton and Jin Haritaworn (2013) argue, moreover, the proliferation of slow death and social death among trans people is especially pronounced in the case of trans people of color, whose lives are routinely diminished while their deaths are memorialized and circulated in ways that serve white feelings and interests. It is in recognition of the operation of optics, so to speak, that Eric Stanley (2017) invokes, á la Édouard Glissant (1990 [1997]), a trans “right to opacity”. If being named and seen, tracked and counted, clocked and targeted, remembered and recirculated puts trans in a visual economy that has cis norms and state interests at heart, then refusing visibility may be the better part of freedom.

4.5 Issues of Law and Policy

Trans philosophy analyzes the institution of law as it relates to the lives of trans and gender disruptive people. It interrogates the nature of law as an administrative apparatus, the sex/gender norms that inform and are informed by specific laws, and the legal precedents, concepts, and applications that most affect trans populations. Insofar as the administration of sex/gender occurs as much through mundane bureaucracies, forms, and protocols, moreover, as it does through Supreme Court rulings, analysis is best activated on multiple registers. Scholars working in this area have been concerned, by turns, with issues of bias, discrimination, and violence, as well as trans panic defenses (Bettcher 2007; Salamon 2018) and conversion therapies (Ashley 2022); sex segregation practices in public accommodations (especially bathrooms), housing shelters, domestic violence shelters, sports competitions, and prisons; and changing protocols for identity documents, nondiscrimination clauses, employment equity, sex work, and trans healthcare provisions (including hormones, surgery, and reproductive rights). Such work ultimately focuses on three major questions. First, what are the relevant laws and policies actually doing? Here attention has turned to the logics that govern sex segregation from the outset (Zurn 2019), as well as to the ways that sex segregation (and sex classification) enacts, entrenches, and/or challenges state projects (Salamon 2010; Draz 2019; Currah 2022). Second, are those laws best reformed or dismantled? Scholars have investigated the limits of law, rights frameworks, and legal reform when it comes to trans flourishing, arguing that neoliberal policy work merely tinkers with a largely harmful system rather than deeply transforming it through grassroots social movements (Spade 2011 [2015]). Finally, what does legal backlash against such efforts illuminate about the function of “trans” in our political landscape (Cannon 2022)?

As trans advocacy has grown, questions about what gets instituted in trans-affirming, or trans-inclusive, or trans-ameliorative law and policy projects have become more pertinent. With a long history of homonormativity (or the institution of norms governing queerness), it is argued, a critical stance has to be taken to trans normativity (and the norms instituted around transness). Merely pro-trans policies, especially for “normal” and therefore mainstreamed trans subjects, are not, in and of themselves, liberatory. As one example, consider the increasing availability of third gender (i.e., “nonbinary”) options on driver’s licenses, passports, and other identification documents. Of concern here is the solidification of a ternary gender system (or a binary system plus one narrow gender disruptive category: nonbinary) which still delimits the gender autonomy and multiplicity characteristic of the trans community and retains the demand that gender be legible and registrable. More substantively, perhaps, consider the increasingly widespread legal redefinition of sex as “gender identity”. In Argentina, this redefinition occurred in one fell swoop with the 2012 Gender Identity Law (De Mauro Rucovsky 2019). In the US, the process has been more piecemeal, including the 2017 California Gender Recognition Act (which anchors sex designations in self-identification) (Draz 2019) and the 2020 Bostock ruling (which extends Title IX protections to gender identity and expression) (Draz 2019; Kohler-Hausmann & Dembroff 2019; Cannon 2022). The concern here is that the collapse of gender identity into legal sex both capitulates too much to the medico-juridical primacy of sex and empties trans genders of the rich layers of relationality and embodiment that exceed mere “identification” discourses (Ben-Asher 2024). Given the politicization of trans life in law and policy today, these questions will only proliferate. What will remain important is to remember the dialectical relationship between changing policies/practices and changing hearts/minds. It has been argued that whatever trans activism looks like on the legal stage, it must be guided by a correlative commitment to nurture the trans poetics of community-building and aesthetic creation that precedes and transcends legislation (Zurn forthcoming-a).

4.6 Trans Ecology

While the majority of trans philosophy is centered in trans and gender disruptive/creative people and is therefore anthropocentric, a robust strand of thinking critiques the institutionalization of anthropocentrism in gender discourse. This strand creates opportunities for critical conversations between trans philosophy, on the one hand, and environmental philosophy and new materialism, on the other. Stryker, Paisley Currah, and Lisa Jean Moore (2008a) argue that the hyphenated prefix trans- cannot be reduced either to gender or to human experience; it is instead always already unmoored among multiple registers of beings, from the biomaterial to the biopolitical. This invites us to think trans- not only as a movement across institutions (and systems) but also between species (Hayward 2008, 2010). Trans-, then, becomes a cipher for becoming trans, or moving across striated categories rather than being one of those categories (Puar 2017; Weil 2022). From this vantage point, transness not only challenges the gender binary but also a range of binaries, including, perhaps most fundamentally, the binaries of human/animal and animacy/inanimacy (DiPietro forthcoming). As developed by Mel Chen in their book Animacies (2012) and subsequent commentary (Chen in Chen & Hayward 2015), “tranimacy” signals the unsettling of these distinctions, which are both logically impossible and politically trenchant. Against the intimately conjoined de-animating forces of racism, speciesism, and cisheteronormativity, Chen pits a profligate animacy that enlivens, precisely, those otherwise made-inanimate, made-object, made-thing. Moves such as this can produce trans ecologies of belonging that frustrate especially settler colonial hierarchies of being (Steinbock, Szczygielska, & Wagner 2017; Vakoch 2020; Hazard 2022).

5. Futures of Trans Philosophy

Having outlined a history (or histories) of trans philosophy and sketched some of the present contours of trans philosophy, especially as taken up in the Americas, it is incumbent now to turn to a consideration of the future (or futures) of trans philosophy. Much like other so-called philosophies of difference, trans philosophy cultivates a rich landscape of philosophical issues and methods that, otherwise, would go undeveloped. But that cultivation, especially at this juncture in its admittedly early trajectory, may not be without growing pains. On a scene of increased trans visibility, as well as anti-trans sentiment and legislation, trans and gender variant life remains under attack and in question on a sociopolitical register. Trans philosophy has the opportunity not only to model how to take trans life seriously, but also to recognize and honor the wisdom of trans and gender disruptive/creative people. In the profession, trans philosophy may, again much like its sibling projects, continue to face the double bind of being perceived as a cutting-edge new subfield and as not serious or rigorous philosophy, as lacking the gravitas and solemn personages of agreed upon canons and histories. However, insofar as trans philosophy remains accountable to and illuminative of trans experiences, histories, cultural productions, and politics; insofar as it engages in experiential, institutional, and self-critique; insofar as it acknowledges the non-universal character of trans experience and the multiplicity of gender disruptive/creative histories; and insofar as it remains committed to an extra-academic stance, not only the standpoint but the stand-places of gender variant communities, trans philosophy may maintain the necessary wherewithal to negotiate these choppy waters, both politically and professionally (Zurn forthcoming-b). In doing so, it may continue to open philosophy not only to new topics and new directions, but to new methodologies, interdisciplinary collaborations, and community-accountable, real-world matterings.

While trans philosophy to date has been practiced and understood as largely centered in and beholden to trans people themselves, it is possible that future iterations of trans philosophy will expand—as trans studies has done—to explore the phenomenon of transing itself. As developed in trans studies, transing refers to the movement by which supposedly fixed entities are crossed, blurred, and unsettled (Stryker, Currah, & Moore 2008a; Aizura et al. 2020). Philosophizing that slippage and leakage is a project still to be undertaken. But transing need not only be a philosophical topic; it also has the potential to be a philosophical method. As Tey Meadow (2016: 322) has argued, “trans* epistemology” does not know in advance how it is that we come to know trans people, but rather advocates for a “relational, contingent, iterative, deeply important, life-giving, infinitely complex” process in which the epistemological subject is kept open and consistently redrawn. If trans signals a fundamental instability—an unboundedness and unfixedness—in things, then trans philosophy may involve thinking less the structure of being than becoming. Refusing restriction to trans terminology as deployed in the last three decades, it may take “trans-” as a line of flight to still other slippages and cracks. In doing so, it may craft a space of belonging for multiple communities that disrupt normative linkages and presumptions of universality. However far that project of trans- philosophy might expand, however, the commitments of trans philosophy insist it remain meaningfully tethered both to the struggles of trans and gender disruptive/creative people on the ground, as well as to critiques of “trans” as a dominating concept among gender variant peoples. The most capacious version of trans philosophy may also be committed beyond theorizing to cultivating trans care networks (Marvin 2019b; Malatino 2020), in and beyond the academy.

Perhaps this tension between the usefulness of “trans” and its inherent limitations, the expansiveness of trans and the specificity of trans communities, the discursive untethering of trans from and the material grounding of trans in gender disruptive peoples, is precisely the uneasy but necessary home of trans philosophy. Trans philosophical work would then be located, attentively and accountably, in those crossings, those slips, those sideways relations (cp. DiPietro forthcoming).

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Cited Resources

• Genderfluid Support, 2019, “Gender Master List”, archive of post to Genderfluid Support Tumblr.
• Bettcher, Talia Mae, 2018, “‘When Tables Speak’: On the Existence of Trans Philosophy” (Guest Post by Talia Mae Bettcher), Daily Nous: News for and about the Philosophy Profession, 30 May 2018.
• Dembroff, Robin, 2018, “Nonbinary Identity Is a Radical Stance against Gender Segregation”, Aeon Essays, 30 October 2018.
• Hale, C. Jacob, 1997, “Suggested Rules for Non-Transsexuals Writing About Transsexuals, Transsexualism, Transsexuality, or Trans”, January 5 1997.
• Intersex Society of North America (ISNA), 2008, “What the Difference Between Being Transgender or Transsexual and Having an Intersex Condition?” ISNA.
• Zurn, Perry, 2016, “Trans Experience in Philosophy”, Blog of the APA, 11 August 2016.

General Resources

• Trans Philosophy Project.

Related Entries

critical theory | feminist philosophy | feminist philosophy, approaches: continental philosophy | feminist philosophy, topics: perspectives on sex and gender | feminist philosophy, topics: perspectives on trans issues | sex and sexuality

Acknowledgments

Thanks to Andrea Pitts, who helped me conceptualize parts of an early draft of the entry and who, alongside PJ DiPietro, provided feedback on an early version of Section 2. Thanks also to Talia Bettcher and Amy Marvin who provided comments on the whole. Thanks to Ann Garry and Cheshire Calhoun for making the entry more accessible. Thanks also to the trans and gender disruptive people, and allies and friends, with whom I have thought many of these things through. Thanks also to Talia and Jake, for their friendship and for leading the way.