Primitivist Theories of Truth

First published Thu Oct 23, 2025

When thinking about truth, it is natural to wonder whether and how truth can be analyzed in more fundamental terms. Numerous philosophers have aimed to so analyze truth, but their theories are all plagued by well-known problems. As a result, none has generated consensus, or even near consensus, among philosophers. Primitivists about truth offer a distinctive take on this situation. They suggest that this negative outcome shouldn’t be surprising, as there are strong reasons for thinking that truth simply cannot be analyzed in more fundamental terms. We may be able to so analyze other aspects of reality, and some of these may even be analyzable in terms of truth. Primitivists insist, though, that when it comes to truth itself, this sort of analysis will always come up short.

This entry will start by outlining a tripartite distinction between the concept of truth, the property of truth, and the terms that we use in speaking about truth. This distinction is standard within debates about truth, and it will inform the rest of the entry. The entry will then provide an overview of the major varieties of primitivism about truth, covering historically significant developments of the view as well as developments by contemporary philosophers. Following this overview, the entry will trace some nuanced connections between primitivist theories and identity, deflationary, and axiomatic theories of truth. It will close with a brief discussion of the empirical significance of primitivism, focusing on how the results of studies on false belief attribution bear on primitivist theories of the concept of truth.

1. Concept, property, terms
2. Early primitivist theories
3. Contemporary primitivist theories
4. Connections to other theories of truth
5. Empirical significance: primitivism and false belief attribution
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1. Concept, property, terms

Theories of truth can have a number of different targets. Three of the most prominent targets have been: (i) the concept truth (we’ll denote concepts using small caps in what follows); (ii) the property truth (we’ll denote properties using italics); and (iii) the truth terms that speakers use.

Philosophers have thought about the nature of the concept truth (and concepts in general) in various ways. According to one standard way of thinking about the concept truth, whatever else we might want to say about its nature and possession-conditions, truth is a mental entity of some sort that thinkers deploy whenever they have thoughts involving truth. For instance, if I believe that some of the things that Laurence said about T.S. Eliot are true, then it would be standardly held that I deploy the concept truth in having this belief. Likewise, I would deploy truth if I wondered whether most of the statements in a late-night infomercial were true or hoped that a scientist’s optimistic predictions about climate change turn out to be true. This way of thinking about truth will surface in §2.1, §§3.1–3.3, §§3.5–3.7, §4.2, and §5 below. In §2.4, by contrast, we will see that one of the most famous primitivists about truth, Gottlob Frege, conceived of the concept truth in an importantly different way.

The property truth is meant to be the property that is possessed by all and only the true truth-bearers. For instance, suppose that propositions (somehow construed) are the bearers of truth. The proposition that Morocco is north of Liberia is true, so this proposition possesses the property truth. By contrast, the proposition that Zambia is north of Chad is not true, so this proposition fails to possess the property truth.

Philosophers who have developed metaphysics of truth standardly aim to identify the nature of the property truth. That said, in some instances, it may be more helpful to describe a theory of the metaphysics of truth as investigating the nature of a relation, rather than a property. A well-known example is correspondence theories of truth, which take truth to consist in some particular relation of correspondence between a truth-bearer such as a belief or a proposition and portion of reality such as a fact. Another sensible way of describing correspondence theories, however, is to take them to investigate the nature of the property truth, where truth is meant to be a relational property (see, e.g., the introduction to the entry on the correspondence theory of truth and Edwards 2021). In what follows, we will set this issue to one side and refer to truth simply as a ‘property’. (For further discussion of the concept-property distinction in work on truth, see Alston 2002; Asay 2013c: ch. 1, 2020: §6.1, 2021a, b; Edwards 2018: ch. 2, 2021; Eklund 2021: §2; Lynch 2009: ch. 1; Nulty 2008; Scharp 2021; Wyatt 2018, 2021; and the references therein.)

Truth terms are, in essence, the linguistic expressions that enable us to speak about truth. In English, truth terms include the familiar ‘true’ and ‘truth’. They also include ‘correct’, ‘incorrect’, ‘right’, and ‘wrong’, when the latter are used in certain sentences, such as ‘Harold believes that vaccines cause autism, but his belief is wrong/incorrect, since vaccines don’t cause autism’. Other natural languages come with their own stocks of truth terms. (For discussions of truth terms in various languages and references to further resources, see, e.g., Mizumoto 2022, 2024; Reuter 2024; and Wyatt & Ulatowski 2024.)

As will become apparent, this basic distinction between truth, truth, and truth terms proves to be very useful when carving up the landscape of primitivist truth theories and when identifying connections between primitivist theories and truth theories of other kinds.

2. Early primitivist theories

2.1 Wang Chong and de facto primitivism

Primitivist theories of truth were discussed extensively during the early years of the analytic tradition in philosophy, and we will focus on these theories in §§2.2–2.4.^[1] Prior to this period, we see primitivist ideas about truth emerge in Western philosophy, though they appear only in an inchoate form. Descartes, for instance, wrote in a letter to Mersenne on 16 October 1639 that

for my part, I have never had any doubts about truth, because it seems a notion so transcendentally clear that nobody can be ignorant of it…no logical definition can be given which will help anyone to discover its nature. (1991: 139)

Similarly, Johann Heinrich Lambert proposed in 1771 that

[t]ruth is a simple concept which, as it does not have several internal marks, can at best be defined or elucidated only through its relations to other concepts. (quoted in Künne 2003: 13)

If we go back much further in the history of philosophy, we encounter an early Chinese philosopher whose body of thought about truth may exemplify a kind of primitivism. This philosopher is Wang Chong (c. 25–100 CE). Wang lived during the Han period, which Alexus McLeod (2018b: 134) has dubbed “the period of concern with truth and method in Chinese thought”. Wang’s writings address a diverse array of topics, including astronomy, physics, ethics, metaphysics, epistemology, and philosophical methodology; for a thorough discussion, see McLeod (2018b).

The only extant volume of Wang’s writings is entitled Lunheng (for an overview of Wang’s life and his writings, see McLeod 2018b: ch. 2). In Duizuo, the second chapter of Lunheng, Wang explains that no matter the subject that he is addressing, his inquiry is animated by a foundational concern for truth (1907: 85):

In a great many books reality has no place left: falsehood and immorality triumph over truth and virtue. Therefore, unless such lies be censured, specious arguments cannot be suppressed, and, as long as they spread, truth does not reign. For this reason, the [Lunheng] weighs the words, whether they be light or heavy, and holds up a balance for truth and falsehood. It does not trouble about polishing the phrases and embellishing the style, or consider this of great importance.

As Wang indicates, he was troubled by the fact that falsehoods can spread more effectively than truths. One of the main reasons that this occurs, according to Wang, is that someone who wishes to spread a falsehood often expresses it using vivid, flowery language that is meant to generate strong emotions among their audience. To combat this phenomenon, Wang resolves to avoid flowery language and to instead express his ideas and arguments as straightforwardly as possible. This, he contends, will enable his readers to more effectively acquire true beliefs and avoid false beliefs.

Given Wang’s serious concern with truth, it is important to consider how Wang speaks about truth when articulating his views. Interestingly, Wang regularly uses three pairs of truth terms: shi/fei 是非, ran/fou 然否, and SHI/xu 實虛. When discussing Wang’s views on truth, McLeod (2018b: ch. 4) translates shi and fei as ‘right’ and ‘wrong’, ran and fou as ‘is the case’ and ‘is not the case’, and SHI and xu as ‘true’ and ‘false’. A somewhat different translation is offered by Lajos Brons (2018), who translates these pairs of terms as ‘right’ and ‘wrong’, ‘is the case’ and ‘is not the case’, and ‘objective/objectivity’ and ‘mere attractive appearance’.

As always, translation is a tricky business, especially when attempting to translate an ancient text into a contemporary language such as English. Without attempting to settle upon a definitive translation of the truth terms that Wang uses, we can note a few key passages from Lunheng in which these pairs of truth terms occur, using McLeod’s translation for the sake of convenience:

The Lunheng uses precise language and detailed discussion, to reveal and explain the doubts of this generation of common people, to bring to light through debate right and wrong principles (是非之理 shi fei zhi li), and to help those who come later clearly see the difference between what is the case (然 ran) and what is not the case (否 fou). (Duizuo 6, quoted by McLeod 2018b, 146)

Those who can determine what is the case (然 ran) and what is not the case (否 fou) feel an ailment in their hearts which pain them [at the thought of truth being subverted by the “common people” and flowery scholarship] … [Mengzi’s] language was straight and to the point, according high place to the right (是 shi) and suppressing the wrong (非 fei). (Duizuo 2, quoted by McLeod 2018b: 145–146)

When the ruler does badly, instruction to change conduct is directed toward the person on high. When the ruler’s subjects are doltish, engaging in discussions is directed toward the people below. When the people below obtain the truth (實 SHI), then instruction of the person on high follows. I hope to stir some of these minds, to help them distinguish between truth (實 SHI) and falsity (虛 xu). Once the distinction between truth and falsity is established, then flowery and artificial writings can be eliminated. When flowery and artificial writings are eliminated, pure and sincere transformations will grow more abundant day by day. (Duizuo 2, quoted by McLeod 2018b: 148)

As these passages illustrate, Wang uses these three pairs of truth terms when developing his ideas about topics such as principles, scholarship, and social and political progress. Notably, however, Wang never attempts to define these truth terms or otherwise elucidate their meanings. This fact has led Lajos Brons to propose that Wang is best interpreted as being a primitivist about truth. He offers the following argument:

[t]he fact that [Wang]—in a book in which truth plays such a central role—never even hinted at what truth is or what shi, ran, or SHI mean strongly suggests that he (implicitly!) considered truth to be primitive. (Brons 2018: 357)

McLeod (2018b: 163) points to a significant difficulty for this argument. He notes that while Wang doesn’t attempt to define or otherwise analyze the meanings of the truth terms that he uses, this isn’t terribly surprising. This is because early Chinese philosophers generally don’t aim to define the central philosophical terms that they use. Instead, they rely on other methods such as the use of case studies to illustrate what these terms mean and why the phenomena that they pick out are significant. Rather than inferring from this that implicit primitivism was widespread among early Chinese philosophers, the more reasonable proposal may be that there are simply deep methodological differences between early Chinese philosophy and contemporary analytic philosophy.

In later postscript, Brons grants that we lack sufficient reasons for taking Wang to explicitly or implicitly endorse a primitivist view of truth. Nevertheless, Brons suggests that there is an interesting sense in which Wang’s body of thought about truth exhibits a kind of primitivism. Brons calls this variety of primitivism ‘de facto primitivism’ about truth. Focusing for the sake of simplicity on the concept truth, the idea is that a body of thought exhibits de facto primitivism if one can endorse that body of thought without being committed to the definability of truth, even though the body of thought does not entail that truth is undefinable (Brons 2018: 366). This, Brons proposes, is precisely what we find in Lunheng: a set of interrelated ideas expressed using shi/fei 是非, ran/fou 然否, and SHI/xu 實虛 which doesn’t entail that the concepts expressed by these terms are undefinable but which one can nevertheless endorse without taking these concepts to be amenable to definition. In §4.3, we will see an additional context in which the notion of de facto primitivism can be put to use. (For further discussion of Wang’s views about truth, see McLeod 2016: ch. 6, 2018a, 2018b, ch. 4 and Mou 2018a, 2018b: §5.3.)

2.2 G.E. Moore’s primitivism about truth

Having discussed Brons’ primitivist interpretation of Wang Chong, we can move forward many years in the history of philosophy to the period when primitivist theories of truth first garnered sustained interest as such. At the advent of the analytic tradition, we find several of the tradition’s leading lights—G.E. Moore, Bertrand Russell, and Gottlob Frege—developing distinctive primitivist theories of truth.

In his classic essay “The nature of judgment” (1899), Moore aims to show that contra F.H. Bradley, the truth or falsity of a proposition cannot depend upon the proposition’s relation to (non-propositional) reality. (This essay was largely extracted from Moore’s 1898 dissertation “The metaphysical basis of ethics”, for which see Moore 2011.) Moore takes propositions to be composed of what he calls ‘concepts’. The notion of a concept which Moore uses in this essay is notably different from the notion that we briefly detailed in §1, according to which concepts are mental entities of some sort. Moore explicitly denies that concepts, in his sense, are mental, saying that “[t]he concept is not a mental fact, nor any part of a mental fact” (1899: 179). Instead, Moore takes concepts to be immutable, extramental entities which are the constituents of propositions and are also what we mean in speaking and thinking (1899: 178, 180). He also insists that we cannot explain the nature of concepts in terms of entities of some other kind, describing concepts as a “genus per se, irreducible to anything else” (1899: 178–179). Interestingly, then, the early Moore favors a primitivist view of concepts as well as a primitivist view of truth. (For further discussion of Moore’s early work in metaphysics, see Baldwin 1990: chs. 1–2.)

Moore argues (1899: 180) that if the truth of a proposition consisted in its relation to reality, then it would follow that, contrary to fact, concepts can be true or false. For instance, Moore contends that this view of truth entails that the concept red is true and the concept chimera is false, since there are real things (viz. red things) to which red is related, though there are no real things to which chimera is related.

Additionally, Moore suggests that there are in fact true propositions that stand in no relation to reality, using the proposition that 2+2=4 as an example. These considerations lead Moore to conclude that

[a] proposition is constituted by any number of concepts, together with a specific relation between them; and according to the nature of this relation the proposition may be either true or false. What kind of relation makes a proposition true, what false, cannot be further defined, but must be immediately recognised. (1899: 180)

Here, we see Moore advancing the view that truth and falsity are primitive properties/relations. In what follows, we will call the view that truth is a primitive property metaphysical primitivism.^[2]

In lectures that were delivered in 1910–1911 and published later as Some Main Problems of Philosophy, Moore went on to reject metaphysical primitivism in favor of a correspondence theory of truth (see the entry on the correspondence theory). Here, Moore develops two concerns for metaphysical primitivism which respectively concern his account of the facts to which true beliefs refer and the analysis of belief on which he takes metaphysical primitivism to rest (1953: 262–263). Wyatt (2022: 3) details some additional concerns that affect Moore’s argument for metaphysical primitivism.

2.3 Bertrand Russell’s primitivism about truth

During the period in which Moore endorsed and later abandoned metaphysical primitivism, Bertrand Russell’s views on truth followed much the same trajectory. In Russell (1904), the third in a trio of papers prompted by the work of Alexius Meinong, Russell’s main aim is to defend the view that all judgments have “transcendent” objects, which Russell calls “propositions”. This view carries a commitment to both true and false propositions, and Russell worries about whether the latter in fact exist. After wrestling with this and numerous nearby issues, Russell ultimately forwards an arresting proposal that would fit perfectly in the early work of Moore:

there is no problem at all in truth and falsehood…some propositions are true and some false, just as some roses are red and some white…[w]hat is truth, and what falsehood, we must merely apprehend, for both seem incapable of analysis. (1904: 523–524)

In a paper that he appears to have read to the Jowett Society in 1905, Russell is mainly concerned to argue that propositions are the bearers of truth and falsity and that true propositions are facts. Along the way, he twice (1905 [1994: 493–494, 504]) maintains that truth is undefinable, offering an argument that is strikingly similar to Frege’s treadmill argument (§2.4).

A pivotal juncture in Russell’s thought about truth is his 1906/7 paper ‘On the nature of truth’. This paper consists mostly of a critical discussion of the ‘monistic theory of truth’, which Russell attributes to the British idealist Harold Joachim. Having thoroughly criticized the monistic theory, Russell aims in the paper’s final section to offer some positive remarks about the nature of truth. Here, his mind is clearly divided between two views. The first is a primitivist theory according to which

the bearers of truth are complex, non-mental entities, which Russell calls ‘propositions’;
facts are true propositions and fictions/objective falsehoods false propositions; and
“[t]ruth and falsehood…are ultimate, and no account can be given of what makes a proposition true or false” (Russell 1906/7: 48).

The second view is a correspondence theory of truth according to which

the bearers of truth are beliefs;
facts are the only non-mental complexes, so that objective falsehoods don’t exist; and
true beliefs are those which correspond to facts.

Russell suggests (1906/7: 49) that both of these theories “seem tenable” and leaves the decision between them to future work.

That decision comes in Russell (1907 [1910]). Here, Russell rejects metaphysical primitivism for three reasons. First, the metaphysical primitivist, as Russell conceives of them, takes the primary bearers of truth to be propositions. In opposition to this view, Russell argues that we would do well to avoid positing propositions as “independent [entities]” and thus as the primary bearers of truth (1907 [1910: 175]). If propositions exist as independent entities, Russell contends, then it must be the case that propositions are the referents of that-clauses such as ‘that Charles I died on the scaffold’. However, Russell is highly skeptical of referential analyses of that-clauses, suggesting that a that-clause “has no complete meaning by itself, which would enable it to denote a definite object as (e.g.) the word ‘Socrates’ does” (1907 [1910: 175]). Russell grants that this is not a knockdown argument against the view that propositions exist as independent entities, insisting nevertheless that “it must be allowed a certain weight” (1907 [1910: 176]).

Russell’s second concern for metaphysical primitivism, which he takes to be “more fatal” (1907 [1910: 176]), arises from the fact that the metaphysical primitivist posits objective falsehoods. Russell finds objective falsehoods ontologically problematic, given that they would exist independently of minds, yet “we feel that there could be no falsehood if there were no minds to make mistakes” (1907 [1910: 176]). This may be a significant concern for metaphysical primitivism. One thing that should be noted, however, is that if the concern is forceful, it would seem to cast doubt on any theory of truth which entails that there are objective falsehoods, irrespective of whether that theory takes falsity to be a primitive property.

Russell’s third concern is also meant to be fatal for metaphysical primitivism, and it centers on the metaphysical primitivist’s contention that truth and falsity are primitive properties. Insofar as it entails that truth and falsity are primitive, Russell argues, metaphysical primitivism renders the distinction between truth and falsity highly mysterious, whereas the correspondence theory that Russell has in mind can arguably shed a great deal of light on this distinction (1907 [1910: 176]). Russell’s third concern continues to trouble philosophers considering metaphysical primitivism; for further discussion, see Wyatt (2022: §3.1).

This shift in Russell’s thinking about truth away from primitivism and towards correspondence proved to be permanent. Russell’s endorsement of the view that truth—or more specifically, the truth of empirical beliefs and sentences—consists in correspondence persisted for the remainder of his life, though he articulated this view in various importantly different ways (see the entry on the correspondence theory, as well as Russell 1912: ch. XII, 1914: 54, 1919a, 1919b: §VI, 1921: ch. XIII, 1927: ch. 24, 1940: chs. XVI, XVII, and XXI, 1946: 849–850, 852, 853–854, 856, 1948: Part II, chs. 8–11, 1959: 63–64, 132, 151, 157, 213, 220, ch. XV.)

2.4 Gottlob Frege’s primitivism about truth

The third early analytic philosopher to endorse primitivism was Gottlob Frege, and unlike Moore and Russell, he remained an enduring advocate of the view. Frege develops what is perhaps the best-known argument for primitivism, which Wolfgang Künne (2003: §3.3.2) helpfully calls the treadmill argument. The name of this argument references a metaphor that Frege uses in the posthumously published essay “Logic”, which was likely written in 1897. In this essay, he discusses the view that propositions are private and mental and are true just when they stand in a relation to a distinct entity that is neither private nor mental.^[3] Frege (“Logic” [1979: 134]) contends that given this view, we could not know whether a proposition is true, as

we should be in the position of a man on a treadmill who makes a step forwards and upwards, but the step he treads on keeps giving way and he falls back to where he was before.

Frege’s argument for this claim (“Logic” [1979: 128–129]) goes by very quickly, but the argument receives a fuller development in Frege’s essay “The thought”.

The more developed argument appears in the following widely discussed passage:

Can it not be laid down that truth exists when there is correspondence in a certain respect? But in which? For what would we then have to do to decide whether something were true? We should have to inquire whether it were true that an idea and a reality, perhaps, corresponded in the laid-down respect. And then we should be confronted by a question of the same kind and the game could begin again. So the attempt to explain truth as correspondence collapses. And every other attempt to define truth collapses too. For in a definition certain characteristics would have to be stated. And in application to any particular case the question would always arise whether it were true that the characteristics were present. So one goes round in a circle. Consequently, it is probable that the content of the word “true” is unique and indefinable. (Frege 1918–1919 [1956: 291])

At the beginning of this passage, Frege offers reasons for thinking that the concept truth, i.e. the content of the word ‘true’, cannot be defined as involving some kind of correspondence. He then suggests that for similar reasons, every purported definition of truth must fail, which shows that truth is “unique and indefinable”. We will call the view that truth is a primitive concept, which Frege endorses here, conceptual primitivism.

One detail that should be flagged in connection with the treadmill argument pertains to Frege’s views about concepts. We noted in §1 that the concept truth is often understood to be mental in nature, and as we will see in §3, most conceptual primitivists have either adopted this understanding of truth or else appear sympathetic towards it. Frege, however, has a distinctive understanding of what sort of entity the concept truth is. As Frege uses the term, concepts are functions from objects to truth-values (see Frege 1891, 1892). For Frege, then, concepts are mathematical in nature, and they are also non-mental. Thus, when Frege forwards the view that the concept truth is primitive, it is the concept truth so conceived that he has in mind.

There has been substantial scholarly disagreement about how, exactly, the treadmill argument should be interpreted (see Asay 2013a: §§3–4, 2013c: chs. 2, 5–6, 2021a: §§1, 3.3, 2021b: §4.1.1; Baldwin 1997; Johnston 2021; Heck & May 2018: §5; Green 2024; Kim 2020, 2021; Künne 2008; Pardey 2012; Ricketts & Levine 1996; Sluga 2002; Walker 1997: §6; and the references therein. For an interesting adaptation of the treadmill, see Trueman 2022: §1.3.) The central issue here is whether we should take the argument to involve an appeal to an allegedly vicious regress or allegedly vicious circularity. Given the prominence of this debate, it is worthwhile to outline these two versions of the argument in detail.

According to the regress interpretation, the treadmill’s structure is essentially this (cp. Künne 2003: 130–131):

(1_R): If truth is defined in terms of some characteristic C, then to determine whether an entity x is true, one must first determine whether x has C [Premise]
(2_R): For any entity x and characteristic Y: to determine whether x has Y, one must first determine whether the proposition that x has Y is true [Premise]
(3_R): If truth is defined in terms of some characteristic C, then to determine whether an entity x is true, one must first determine whether x has C, which requires one to previously determine whether the proposition that x has C is true [(1_R), (2_R)]
(4_R): If truth is defined in terms of some characteristic C, then to determine whether the proposition that x has C is true, one must first determine whether the proposition that x has C has C [(1_R)]
(5_R): To determine whether the proposition that x has C has C, one must first determine whether the proposition that (the proposition that x has C has C) is true [(2_R)]
(6_R): If truth is defined in terms of some characteristic C, then to determine whether an entity x is true, one must first determine whether x has C, which requires one to previously determine whether the proposition that x has C is true, which requires one to previously determine whether the proposition that x has C has C, which requires one to previously determine whether the proposition that (the proposition that x has C has C) is true, and so on ad infinitum [(3_R)-(5_R)]

(7_R): If truth is defined in terms of some characteristic C, then to determine whether an entity x is true, one must separately determine whether an infinite number of propositions are true/have C [(6_R)]
(8_R): It is not possible for any person to separately determine whether an infinite number of propositions are true/have C [Premise]
(9_R): It is possible for some persons to determine whether some entities are true [Premise]
(10_R): It is not the case that truth is defined in terms of some characteristic C [(7_R)–(9_R)].

By contrast, according to the circularity interpretation, the treadmill has the following structure (cp. Asay 2013c: 140–141):

(1_C): If truth is defined in terms of some characteristic C, then to determine whether an entity x is true, one must first determine whether x has C [Premise]
(2_C): For any entity x and characteristic Y: to determine whether x has Y, one must first determine whether the proposition that x has Y is true [Premise]
(3_C): If one determines whether the proposition that x has C is true, then in doing so, one uses truth [Premise]
(4_C): For any entity x: to determine whether x has C, one must use truth [(2_C), (3_C)]
(5_C): If truth is defined in terms of some characteristic C, then for any entity x, it is impossible to determine in an epistemically non-circular way whether x is true [(1_C)–(4_C)]
(6_C): For some entity x: it is possible to determine in an epistemically non-circular way whether x is true [Premise]
(7_C): It is not the case that truth is defined in terms of some characteristic C [(5_C), (6_C)]

Selecting one of these interpretations of the treadmill is a delicate matter to be sure. Whichever way the treadmill is interpreted, though, it faces some significant concerns. To illustrate, suppose that I offer the following simple definition of truth:

(Corr): For all \(x\): truth applies to \(x =_{\textrm{df}} x\) corresponds to a fact.

If I want to know whether a particular entity a is true, then (Corr) suggests that I should ask whether a corresponds to a fact. Frege will claim (recall (2_R)/(2_C) above) that to determine whether a corresponds to a fact, I must first determine whether the proposition that a corresponds to a fact is true. However, this claim is certainly debatable. To know whether a corresponds to a fact, it would seem that I need to know only the following things:

which entity a is;
what the correspondence relation C is;
what facts are; and
whether there exists a fact f to which a stands in C.

This isn’t to deny, of course, that the proposition that a corresponds to a fact is logically equivalent to the proposition that (the proposition that a corresponds to a fact) is true. Yet even if these propositions are logically equivalent, that doesn’t show that the latter is epistemically prior to the former. If it isn’t, then the treadmill looks to falter at (2_R)/(2_C). (For an especially nice articulation of this concern, see Asay 2013c: §5.1. For a related discussion of Frege’s conception of judgment and the role that it is meant to play in the treadmill, see Kim 2021.)

3. Contemporary primitivist theories

3.1 Truth, Tarski, and meaning

Debates about truth continued to be very lively throughout the twentieth century and have maintained a great deal of momentum during the twenty-first century. In the twentieth century, the most visible advocates of primitivism were Donald Davidson (1983, 1990a, b, 1995, 1996, 1998, 2000, 2004, 2020) and Ernest Sosa (1993a, b, 2001), who both defended versions of conceptual primitivism. (See also Rorty 2000: 126, Savery 1955: 514, and Strawson 1992: 24, as well as Sluga 1999’s discussion of Carnap’s views about truth.)

Davidson’s advocacy of primitivism was heavily informed by his admiration for the work of Alfred Tarski and his sense that Tarski had proved that the concept truth is undefinable. Davidson (1990b: 285–286) observes that in developing his theory of truth, Tarski defines various truth predicates each of which is meant to apply to sentences from a particular language L. By contrast, Tarski doesn’t attempt to define a fully general truth predicate which is meant to apply to sentences from any arbitrary language whatsoever. The explanation for this, Davidson contends, is that Tarski proved that no such predicate can be defined. Davidson takes this Tarskian proof to show by extension that our concept truth, which is meant to be fully general in the above sense, is also undefinable.

In a much-cited passage, Davidson (1996 [2005: 20–21]) summarizes the central lesson that he takes from Tarski’s work as follows (see also Davidson 1977 [1984: 216], 1983 [2001: 139]):

For the most part, the concepts philosophers single out for attention, like truth, knowledge, belief, action, cause, the good and the right, are the most elementary concepts we have…Why then should we expect to be able to reduce these concepts definitionally to other concepts that are simpler, clearer, and more basic? We should accept the fact that what makes these concepts so important must also foreclose on the possibility of finding a foundation for them which reaches deeper into bedrock.

We should apply this obvious observation to the concept of truth: we cannot hope to underpin it with something more transparent or easier to grasp. Truth is, as G. E. Moore, Bertrand Russell and Frege maintained, and Tarski proved, an indefinable concept.

Using a primitive concept truth, Davidson went on to develop a program in semantics whose influence cannot be overstated. A central idea of this program is that the meaning of a linguistic expression consists in its contribution to the truth-conditions of the sentences in which it occurs. This idea is also based on the work of Tarski, who explored definitions of truth based on biconditionals such as:

(1): ‘Morocco is north of Liberia’ is true iff Morocco is north of Liberia.

Davidson’s approach is to treat a Tarskian theory of truth as being a theory of what the sentences that are used by a particular speaker mean. If (1) is entailed by such a theory, which is attributed to a particular speaker A, then the theory also entails that when A uses the sentence ‘Morocco is north of Liberia’, A means that Morocco is north of Liberia (see, e.g., Davidson 1977, and cp. Davidson 2020).

This proposal regarding the relationship between truth and meaning illustrates a more general feature of the methodology for investigating truth that Davidson ultimately came to endorse. This method has it that instead of trying to analyze truth in terms of more basic concepts, we should instead attempt to identify significant connections between truth and other concepts that we use. One such connection is that between truth and meaning, which Davidson takes his application of Tarski’s ideas to reveal. P.F. Strawson (1992: ch. 2) helpfully describes this approach as the connective model of conceptual analysis. For further discussion of Davidson’s methodology and the ways in which he applies it, see the entry on Donald Davidson and Glanzberg (2013).

A significant concern for Davidson is that while Tarski’s work on truth undoubtedly marks a watershed moment in the history of philosophy, it is not at all clear that Tarski proved that truth is a primitive concept. The theorem concerning truth that Tarski proved concerns specific formal languages. Described in rudimentary terms, the theorem has it that if a formal language L has a particular degree of expressive power, then truth for the sentences of L cannot be defined in L. This theorem is about truth predicates for specific kinds of formal languages, rather than truth, which is meant to be a concept that is possessed by speakers of a highly diverse range of natural languages. For this reason, Tarski’s undefinability theorem doesn’t provide clear support for conceptual primitivism.^[4]

Yet even if this is so, Davidson’s understanding of the import of Tarski’s work may still point us in the right direction. A notable view in the vicinity of Davidson’s is that while Tarski didn’t exactly prove that truth is primitive, Tarski’s views about truth fit more naturally with conceptual primitivism than with other theories of truth, such as correspondence or deflationary theories. (For a defense of this view and the above criticism of Davidson, see Asay 2013b, 2013c: ch. 7. For further discussion of Tarski’s thought about truth, see Halbach 2011: chs. 1, 3; Horsten 2011: chs. 2–4; Patterson 2012: 144–160; and the entry on Tarski’s truth definitions.)

3.2 Truth, epistemology, and external realism

Ernest Sosa (2001: 659) has sided with Davidson in holding that “[t]ruth is a primitive concept and has no illuminating definition or Moorean analysis”. Sosa’s ambition in his discussions of conceptual primitivism is to provide an account of truth that (i) is compatible with a truth-centered epistemology according to which epistemic concepts such as knowledge and epistemic justification must be analyzed in terms of truth and (ii) is compatible with external realism, according to which

external reality…is not dependent on human thought, and might have been just as it is now even in our absence, and even in the absence of any contingent thinkers whatever. (2001: 643)

Sosa argues for conceptual primitivism by elimination, offering various concerns for competing accounts of truth, including noncognitivist, pragmatist, and correspondence theories. The noncognitivist account that Sosa discusses is based in the work of Richard Rorty, who maintained that the word ‘true’ is “merely an expression of commendation” (Rorty 1991: 23). The corresponding account of the concept truth has it that the sole function of truth is to commend beliefs, theories, assertions, etc. with which one agrees. Against this account, Sosa points out that it seems to succumb to the embedding problem that is standardly raised against noncognitivist theories. For instance, consider the belief that if what Barry said about Susan is true, then Susan will come to the dinner party. In forming this belief, I deploy truth. However, it would seem that in doing so, I don’t commend what Barry said, or anything else for that matter (see also Sosa 2001: 649, and see Schroeder 2010 for further discussion of expressivism about truth).

The pragmatist account of truth that Sosa considers is based in the thought of C.S. Peirce. A proponent of this account aims to explicate truth by proposing that

a true belief [is] one that would be accepted rationally and justifiably by ideal inquirers in an ideal epistemic situation for that belief and its subject matter. (Sosa 2001: 642)

This account explicates truth using the concepts rationality and epistemic justification. Accordingly, Sosa points out that a defender of the account faces the challenge of analyzing the latter concepts in truth-free terms, lest they be caught up in vicious circularity. While this sort of project may have some potential, undertaking it is clearly a tall order, given that it seems highly natural to analyze rationality and epistemic justification in terms of truth.

Thirdly, Sosa considers correspondence theories of truth according to which “the sentences on our lips or in our brains are true when and only when they correspond appropriately with the facts or with reality” (2001: 642). Sosa suggests (2001: 646) that the success of such correspondence theories will depend upon the development of a satisfactory theory of reference, which is likely to take reference to consist in the obtaining of certain causal relations (see, e.g., Field 1972). He also notes that despite a great deal of work in this area, we seem to lack such a theory of reference, which calls the prospects of such correspondence theories into question.

It is worthwhile to note that the correspondence theories which Sosa has in mind here would seem to be theories of the nature of the property truth, rather than theories of the concept truth. The aim of such theories is to articulate the conditions under which a sentence is true, which can be naturally regarded as the conditions that must be met for a sentence to possess truth. By contrast, the correspondence theories at issue aren’t meant to be theories of how we ordinarily think about truth, which indicates that they aren’t meant to shed light on our concept truth. For this reason, such correspondence theories aren’t obviously competitors with Sosa’s conceptual primitivism, given that one can consistently defend rather different theories of truth and truth (on this point, see, e.g., Alston 2002, as well as §3.7. For further critical discussion of Sosa’s views about truth and its role in epistemology, see McGrath & Fantl 2013).

3.3 Thick disquotationalism

Colin McGinn (2000) has put forward a primitivist account of truth that he calls thick disquotationalism. Thick disquotationalism is primitivist at both the conceptual and the metaphysical levels (though admittedly, the concept-property distinction proves to be slippery when it surfaces in McGinn’s discussion). The signature theses of thick disquotationalism include (2000: 104–105):

(TD₁): truth is primitive in that it cannot be decomposed into simpler concepts;
(TD₂): Truth is primitive in the sense that it lacks an “underlying empirical nature;” yet
(TD₃): Both truth and truth are non-circularly definable.

(TD₃) might seem to be inconsistent with both (TD₁) and (TD₂), but McGinn argues to the contrary. McGinn’s arguments for the non-circular definability of truth and truth appeal to what he calls the ‘disquotation principle’.

‘Disquotation principle’ is actually a misnomer for the principle that McGinn has in mind here (he acknowledges this on 2000: 88 but persists in using this name for the principle). As Quine (1970 [1986: 12]) famously explains, disquotation is meant to be a procedure that applies to the quotation names of sentences such as:

(2): ‘Morocco is north of Liberia’.

However, McGinn’s favored truth-bearers are propositions, rather than sentences. As a result, the principle on which he draws is in fact Paul Horwich’s Equivalence Schema (for further discussion of Horwich’s views, see §4.2 and the entry on deflationism about truth). The Equivalence Schema has it that:

(ES): The proposition that p is true iff p.

McGinn’s argument for the non-circular definability of truth turns on the claim that truth can be defined as the one and only self-effacing property (2000: 104). To say that truth is self-effacing is to say that we can state truth’s instantiation conditions without referring to truth itself.

McGinn takes (ES) to show us that truth is self-effacing. Consider an instance of (ES) such as:

(3): The proposition that Zambia is north of Chad is true iff Zambia is north of Chad.

McGinn would suggest that (3) tells us which condition is both necessary and sufficient for the proposition that Zambia is north of Chad to possess truth. This condition is just that Zambia is north of Chad. Notably, when we describe this condition, we don’t need to use ‘true’, ‘truth’, or any other expression that could be reasonably taken to denote or express truth. In this way, it seems that we are able to say what it takes for a given proposition to possess truth without explicitly or implicitly mentioning truth. McGinn’s contention is that truth is the only property that behaves in this way. In light of this contention, he puts forward the following definition of truth (2000: 104):^[5]

(4): The proposition that p is true iff the proposition that p has the self-effacing property.

McGinn suggests that defining truth as the one and only self-effacing property is compatible with the view that truth is primitive in that it lacks an underlying empirical nature. In this way, McGinn takes truth’s primitiveness to be compatible with its non-circular definability. For discussion of a number of apparent counterexamples to McGinn’s contention that truth is the only self-effacing property, see Wrenn (2004).

Turning to McGinn’s argument for the non-circular definability of truth, the details are much the same. McGinn’s contention here (2000: 105–106) is that truth is non-circularly definable insofar as its application conditions can be stated without using another concept C that is extensionally or intensionally identical to truth. This fact is again meant to be demonstrated by (ES). McGinn suggests that it is suitable to read (ES) as telling us that truth applies to a proposition p iff p. This means that from (ES), we learn, for instance, that truth applies to the proposition that Zambia is north of Chad iff Zambia is north of Chad. In articulating the right-hand side of this biconditional, we seem to have used neither truth nor any concept that is extensionally or intensionally identical to truth.

Taking truth to be defined by (ES) in this way looks to be compatible with the view that it is not possible to decompose truth into simpler concepts. For this reason, McGinn takes truth’s primitiveness to also be compatible with its non-circular definability.

Wrenn (2004: §VII) points to a significant question that can be raised for McGinn’s argument for the non-circular definability of truth. The question is whether schemas such as (ES) can be properly regarded as definitions. If schemas shouldn’t be regarded as definitions, then McGinn’s argument for truth’s non-circular definability seems to be seriously flawed, which calls (TD₃) into question. Notably, though, this potential flaw doesn’t put pressure on McGinn’s conceptual primitivism. This is because it doesn’t call into question the idea that truth cannot be decomposed into simpler concepts, i.e. (TD₁). For further discussion of related issues, see §4.2 and the entry on definitions.

3.4 Truth as a monadic, non-intrinsic property

In the twenty-first century, primitivism has been endorsed, often briefly, by an extensive range of philosophers. Here, we will focus on the most detailed twenty-first century defenses of primitivism. These come respectively from Trenton Merricks, Timothy Nulty, Douglas Patterson, and Jamin Asay. (For additional endorsements, see Armstrong 2004: 17; Boghossian 2010: 562–3; Hinzen 2007: 10–11, 13; Khatchadourian 2011: i–ii, 2–3; MacFarlane 2005: 305, 313, 321, 2014: 98, 100; McLeod 2016: x, 21, 31, 33–35, 52, 106, 175, 2018b: 133; Lowe 2007: 259; Rumfitt 2022: 299; Schaffer 2008: 309; Simionato 2023; Wiggins 2022: 164–165, §12, n. 14; and B. Williams 2002: 63. See also Zalta 2014.)

Merricks (2007: ch. 8) puts forward a notable variety of metaphysical primitivism according to which truth is a monadic (i.e. non-relational), non-intrinsic property that cannot be analyzed, at least when it is exemplified by its primary bearers. He offers two reasons for taking truth to be a monadic property. The first is that truth, according to Merricks, cannot be a relation between a truth-bearer, e.g., a proposition or a belief, and some other entity or entities (note the parallel with Moore 1899’s criticisms of Bradley). Merricks supports this claim by developing a systematic case for the view that some truths lack truthmakers, i.e. that some truth-bearers are true even though they are not true in virtue of standing in a relation to a certain entity or entities. A running example is negative existential propositions, such as the proposition that hobbits do not exist, which Merricks argues cannot be made true by any existing entity or entities.

While Merricks denies that truth is a relation, he nevertheless argues (2007: §V) that truth exists by presenting two concerns for a deflationary view according to which it fails to exist. Combining his denial that truth is a relation with his affirmation of truth’s existence, Merricks concludes that truth must be a monadic property. An interesting wrinkle is that while Merricks takes truth to be monadic, he also insists that truth is non-intrinsic, given that “whether a proposition exemplifies [truth] is often a matter of how things are around it” (2007: 182). For instance, Merricks would hold that even though truth is not itself a relation, the truth of the proposition that apples are solid is determined not just by the nature of that proposition but also by the solidity of apples.

Having concluded that truth is monadic, Merricks suggests that if truth were analyzable, then it would have to be analyzable in terms of monadic properties that are exemplified by all and only the true truth-bearers. Yet he takes the latter hypothesis to be highly dubious, pointing briefly to a characteristic remark by Russell (e.g., 1912: 70) to the effect that the truth of a belief cannot be plausibly taken to consist in intrinsic properties of the belief such as its “vividness”. This leads Merricks to infer that truth is not analyzable and is thus a primitive property.

While it is sharply formulated, Merricks’ argument for metaphysical primitivism may proceed a bit too quickly. In particular, it is worth noting that the remark by Russell which Merricks uses to motivate metaphysical primitivism concerns beliefs’ intrinsic properties, rather than their monadic properties. Since Merricks takes some monadic properties to be non-intrinsic, an appeal to this remark looks to be out of place in Merricks’ argument.

Merricks’ response to this concern might very well be concessive, given that he maintains that

[t]he monadicity of [truth] is the main point here. Its primitivity is not essential to the other claims about truth made in this chapter or, indeed, in this book. (2007: 183)

These remarks show that Merricks sees metaphysical primitivism, in contrast to the view that truth is monadic, as a highly negotiable aspect of his overall views on truth and truthmaking. (For an additional response to Merricks on behalf of truth pluralism, see Edwards 2018: ch. 9. See also Griffith 2015 and Rasmussen 2014: §1.4.4, ch. 6.)

3.5 Primitive disclosive alethism

Timothy Nulty has defended a variety of conceptual primitivism that he calls primitive disclosive alethism. In defending primitive disclosive alethism, Nulty offers three main reasons for taking truth to be primitive which are based on ideas from Davidson and Martin Heidegger.

The first reason involves the Heideggerian idea that we don’t take true assertions to agree with things that they represent but instead take true assertions to ‘point to’ or ‘reveal’ particular parts of reality (see Heidegger 1927 [1962: 260–261]). Nulty (2006: 191, 2007: 13) endorses this idea, proposing as well that the relation of pointing to/revealing isn’t analyzable in more fundamental terms. This is meant to show that truth is not analyzable in more fundamental terms.

This argument doesn’t clearly provide a reason for taking truth to be primitive. The Heideggerian proposal at issue here seems to involve analyzing truth in terms of pointing/revealing. If the latter concepts are more fundamental than truth, then this Heideggerian proposal actually militates against conceptual primitivism. A key question to be investigated, then, is whether we should take pointing/revealing to be more or less fundamental than (or perhaps equifundamental with) truth. This is a question that should presumably be investigated using the methods of cognitive science; for a discussion of related topics, see §5.

Nulty’s second reason (2006: 191, 2007: 14) for taking truth to be primitive specifically concerns purported definitions of truth in terms of correspondence. These definitions, he suggests, will define truth in terms of a correspondence between truth-bearers and certain parts of reality—e.g., facts—that are meant to exist independently of human thought and language. Nulty argues, however, that when we carve reality up into parts such as facts, this carving is ineliminably informed by human biology and human social practices, including our linguistic practices (2006: 179–181, 2007: §3). For this reason, he finds the idea that there is a privileged carving of reality which is correct independent of human thought and language to be suspect. On this basis, Nulty contends that truth cannot be defined in correspondence-theoretic terms.

One limitation of this argument is that it seems possible to offer a correspondence-theoretic definition of truth which doesn’t fit the mold that Nulty has detailed. One might define truth in terms of a correspondence between truth-bearers (e.g., beliefs) and facts, while also taking the existence of facts to be somehow constrained by human thought and/or language. In effect, this would amount to a combination of a correspondence theory of truth with a variety of anti-realism about facts. While such a combination would be atypical, it nevertheless appears to be internally consistent. (For an observation along the same lines, see §9.2 of the entry on the correspondence theory of truth. Note also that McTaggart held a nearby view, which combines a correspondence theory of truth with a form of ontological idealism; see §5 of the entry on John M.E. McTaggart.)

Nulty’s third reason for taking truth to be primitive (2006: 191, 2007: 14) is that as Davidson and Heidegger emphasized, for something to be a thinking subject, it must possess truth. This means that one must possess truth to possess any other concepts, which indicates that truth is primitive. §5 of this entry will discuss evidence from developmental and comparative psychology that bears on this line of argument.

3.6 The conception of truth as circular

Douglas Patterson has laid out a distinctive take on the idea that truth is a primitive concept, according to which the conception of truth is circular. As Patterson (2010: 13, 21) uses the term, the conception of the concept truth is the set of claims about truth that anyone who possesses truth must be disposed to accept upon consideration. Patterson calls claims of this sort conceptually analytic for the concept truth.

Patterson’s conceptual primitivism has it that the conception of truth is circular, in that upon analysis, all of the claims that constitute truth’s conception turn out to involve truth. Extending the metaphor in the passage from Davidson quoted in §3.1, we can say that Patterson’s core contention is that the conception of truth does not reach deeper into bedrock, insofar as its conception is shot through with instances of truth.

Patterson provides two main reasons for taking truth’s conception to be circular in this way. (For a third reason that he presents very briefly, see 2010: 24.) The first (2010: 21, 26) is the conjecture that when asked ‘What is truth?’, ordinary speakers will not be disposed to offer non-circular responses to this question. Patterson takes this to indicate that the concept truth which ordinary speakers possess has a circular conception.

Upon reflection, it should be clear that Patterson is putting forward an empirical conjecture here that should in turn be evaluated empirically. To date, the only extant empirical data which bear directly on Patterson’s conjecture are the qualitative data that were reported by Arne Næss (1938a, b). Further work would be needed to determine whether Næss’ data confirm or disconfirm Patterson’s conjecture. (Other relevant data include those of Barnard & Ulatowski 2013, 2021; Kölbel 2008; Mizumoto 2022, 2024; Reuter 2024; and Reuter & Brun 2021.)

Patterson’s second motivation for his conceptual primitivism is that every extant theory according to which truth has a non-circular conception is highly problematic (2010: §2). Summarizing briefly, Patterson takes deflationary theories of truth to be unsatisfactory insofar as they invite either the problem of necessity or the problem of paradox (2010: 14–16). The problem of necessity is meant to have two aspects: (i) that deflationary theories misidentify the set of claims that are conceptually analytic for truth and (ii) that deflationary theories implausibly entail that anyone who possesses truth must know the meaning of every English expression. The problem of paradox is meant to be that we can derive logical falsehoods from deflationary theories of truth given the familiar suite of semantic paradoxes such as the Liar paradox.

Patterson takes minimalist theories of truth such as that of Horwich (1998) (which he regards as being distinct from deflationary theories) to be unsatisfactory as they cannot deliver a satisfying account of what it is for a sentence or an utterance to ‘express’ a proposition (Patterson 2010: 18). He takes traditional substantivist theories of truth—e.g., correspondence, coherence, or pragmatist theories—to be problematic because they either turn out to be circular or to misidentify the intension, and in some cases the extension, of truth (2010: 18–19). Finally, Patterson takes pluralist theories of truth to be inadequate as they either inherit the problems with deflationary theories or misidentify truth’s intension (2010: 20–21).

Patterson’s criticisms here are all highly nuanced, and they deserve extended consideration. An issue that should be flagged, though, is one that dovetails with the apparent shortcoming in Patterson’s first motivation for conceptual primitivism. A claim to the effect that truth (or any concept, for that matter) has such-and-so intension or extension, or that a given theory misidentifies truth’s intension or extension, would seem to be empirical in nature. Whether a claim of either of these sorts is true or false hinges on what truth’s intension or extension actually is, and that is presumably an empirical matter. Accordingly, while armchair reflection on a conjecture of either of these sorts may lend it some initial credibility, it must ultimately be evaluated in light of empirical evidence regarding how ordinary thinkers (or ordinary English speakers, or whoever the target population are) think about truth.

3.7 Primitivist deflationism

Lastly, over an extensive body of work, Jamin Asay (2013a, b, c, 2014, 2018, 2021a, b) has developed the most thorough and nuanced defense of primitivism to date. Primitivism is standardly viewed as a rival to deflationism, which has been one of the most popular approaches to truth (see, e.g., Burgess & Burgess 2011: 87; Künne 2003: Figs. 1.2 and 1.3, 317; Lynch, Wyatt, Kim, and Kellen 2021: 506–507; and Wright 1998: 33). A core thesis of deflationary theories of truth is that truth is insubstantial in that (i) we can’t say anything very interesting about its nature and (ii) it lacks explanatory power (for further discussion, see §4.2 of this entry, the entry on deflationism about truth, as well as Edwards 2013, 2018: ch. 2; Eklund 2021; Scharp 2021: §10; Wyatt 2016, 2021, 2023a; and the references therein). With the concept-property distinction in view (§1), it is easy to see that there are at least two levels, so to speak, at which one might be a deflationist: one might be a deflationist about truth, or one might be a deflationist about truth (or both).^[6]

For his part, Asay argues that we should accept a version of deflationism about truth while firmly rejecting deflationism about truth, opting instead for primitivism about truth. Asay, then, is a conceptual primitivist and a metaphysical deflationist, so it is useful to call his theory of truth primitivist deflationism. (For a different case for combining deflationism with primitivism, see Greimann 2000.)

Primitivist deflationism consists of four core theses:^[7]

Fundamentality: truth is fundamental—it cannot be analyzed in terms of more fundamental concepts
Explanatory Indispensability: truth is explanatorily indispensable—we must use truth to explain certain phenomena
Omnipresence: truth is a structural component of every propositional thought
Insubstantiality: The property truth is a non-primitive, but nevertheless insubstantial, property.

With regard to Fundamentality, the initial idea is that we can think of our concepts as being arranged in a dependence structure. To possess a concept that is higher up in this structure, one must possess one or more concepts that are lower down, though not vice versa. To say that truth is fundamental, then, is to say that truth resides at the ground level of this structure—that there is no concept C such that to possess truth, one must possess C but not vice versa.

Explanatory Indispensability sets up a link between Asay’s views and those of Davidson. Both Asay and Davidson reject deflationism about truth insofar as they take truth to have explanatory power. That is, they hold that there are phenomena that we just can’t explain without using truth. One of these phenomena is linguistic meaning. As explained in §3.1, Davidson maintained that a declarative sentence has a certain meaning because it has certain truth-conditions. Asay concurs (2013c: §8.4), and infers that to explain the nature of linguistic meaning, we cannot do without truth. We will say more about the connections between primitivist and deflationary theories in §4.2.

Omnipresence rests on a contrast between two kinds of components of propositional thoughts, where a propositional thought is a state of mind such as believing, regretting, or imagining that has propositional content. According to Asay, some of the components of propositional thoughts are aboutness-determining, in that they (partially) determine what a propositional thought is about.^[8] By contrast, he takes other components of propositional thoughts to be structural, in that they (partially) determine the structure of a propositional thought without determining what it is about. For example, we can regard the belief that stones are not liquid as being composed of the concepts stone, liquid, and (propositional) negation. It is fair to say that this belief is about stones and liquidity, which means that stone and liquid are aboutness-determining components of the belief. By contrast, it seems that the belief isn’t about negation. Rather, negation looks to be a structural component of the belief.

Omnipresence is the claim that truth is similar to negation, except that truth is a structural component of every propositional thought. Asay (2013a: §3, 2013c: §5.2, 2021a: §3.3) defends Omnipresence via the omnipresence argument, which is meant to be a new-and-improved successor to Frege’s treadmill argument.

Lastly, as a metaphysical deflationist, Asay maintains that while the property truth isn’t primitive, it is nevertheless a merely insubstantial property. One of Asay’s main concerns for metaphysical primitivism is that it looks to entail that facts about which truth-bearers are/aren’t true are objectionably mysterious (2013c: 75, 87–88, 2021a, 526). As we saw in §2.3, Russell also took this to be a serious problem with metaphysical primitivism. Asay’s central idea in connection with truth’s insubstantiality is that while truth does exist, this property lacks the explanatory power that is enjoyed by what David Lewis (1983) called ‘sparse’ or ‘natural’ properties. In this respect, Asay’s views about truth are the polar opposite of his views about truth.

Asay’s primitivist deflationism is a novel and provocative theory. §5 will briefly examine its prospects in light of relevant empirical findings on false belief attribution. For discussion of a range of concerns that can be raised for the theory, see Collins (2015) and Wyatt (2023b).

Table 1 provides a brief overview of the major primitivist theories of truth. An asterisk signifies that the relevant primitivist interpretation is controversial.

Table 1: Primitivist theories of truth
Philosopher	Conceptual primitivism	Metaphysical primitivism
Wang Chong	✓*
Early Moore		✓
Early Russell		✓
Frege	✓
Davidson	✓
Sosa	✓
McGinn	✓	✓
Merricks		✓
Nulty	✓
Patterson	✓
Asay	✓

4. Connections to other theories of truth

There are a number of multifaceted connections between primitivist truth theories and truth theories of other kinds. This section will provide an overview of the ways in which primitivist theories are related to identity theories, deflationary theories, and axiomatic theories of truth.

4.1 Primitivism and identity theories of truth

According to identity theories of truth, a proposition p is true iff p is identical to a fact. In the literature on identity theories, the following question has loomed large: should an identity theorist be a primitivist about the property truth? There is a fair amount of consensus that the answer to this question is ‘Yes’.

It is standardly held that in the period in which Moore and Russell took truth to be primitive, they also endorsed identity theories of truth (see the entry on the identity theory of truth and Cartwright 1987). In a similar fashion, Frege remarks near the end of ‘The thought’:

“Facts, facts, facts” cries the scientist if he wants to emphasize the necessity of a firm foundation for science. What is a fact? A fact is a thought that is true. (1918–1919 [1956, 307])

This remark suggests that in addition to holding that truth is primitive, Frege may have endorsed an identity theory of truth. Given the concept-property distinction (§1), this view appears to at least be internally consistent. (See also Candlish 1999: n. 22 on Meinong’s views about truth. For a critical discussion of the view that Frege and the early Moore and Russell endorsed identity theories of truth, see Asay 2013c: §3.4.2.)

Jennifer Hornsby, a leading contemporary advocate of an identity theory of truth, claims in her highly influential paper on the topic that her identity theory of truth “acknowledges truth’s indefinability” (1997: n. 5). Julian Dodd, another leading identity theorist, emphasizes likewise that what he calls ‘modest’ identity theories are compatible with “the view that truth cannot be defined” (2000: 123). Additionally, Colin Johnston (2013: §2.3, §5.2, nn. 2, 4) has argued that if an identity theory of truth is paired with a dual relation (rather than a multiple relation) theory of judgment, then if a judgment’s truth condition obtains/doesn’t obtain, the fact that it obtains/doesn’t obtain is “brute”. (See also Engel 2001: 446’s criticism of what he calls an “identity theory of facts”, one version of which entails that truth is primitive, as well as Candlish & Damnjanovic 2018: 277. Working in the opposite direction, Nulty 2006: 184–185, 2007: §5 argues that his primitive disclosive alethism is importantly distinct from identity theories of truth.)

More recently, Richard Gaskin (2021: chs. 6–7) has defended an identity theory of truth which he takes to motivate the view that truth is an undefinable property. Gaskin takes the bearers of truth to be Russellian propositions, which are meant to be composed of particulars such as Socrates and properties such as being wise (2021: 89, 101). He asks us (2021: §30) to consider a correspondence theory of truth which takes truth to consist in correspondence between Russellian propositions and obtaining states of affairs that are numerically distinct from those propositions.

Gaskin’s concern for such a theory is founded in the thought that there is no “linguistic distance” between the ways in which we talk about propositions and the ways in which we talk about states of affairs (2021: 179). He notes that we use that-clauses such as ‘that Socrates is wise’ to pick out both propositions and states of affairs. Moving a step further, he says,

[l]et us ask: why is the proposition that Socrates is wise true? If I reply by saying that it is true because it corresponds to an obtaining state of affairs, namely that Socrates is wise, I seem to have explained nothing but merely repeated the explanandum. (2021: 179)

Given that he takes sentences of the form ‘Proposition p is true’ and ‘Proposition p corresponds to an obtaining state of affairs’ to have the same content, Gaskin concludes that we cannot explain why true propositions are true by mentioning that they correspond to obtaining states of affairs.

Instead, Gaskin’s proposal is that true propositions are identical to obtaining states of affairs and false propositions are identical to non-obtaining states of affairs. This identity theory is meant to better reflect the lack of linguistic distance between our ways of talking about propositions and states of affairs. Moreover, Gaskin argues, this theory entails that truth is undefinable. According to the theory, the proposition p is true iff it is identical to an obtaining state of affairs/fact. Remarking on this general statement, Gaskin urges that “it is hard to see that much of substance has thereby been said about truth” (2021: 180). That is, Gaskin takes this general statement about truth to fall short of a definition of truth, insofar as it fails to illuminate truth’s underlying nature. His reason appears to again be that the left- and right-hand sides of this biconditional have the same content (see 2021: 181, 183).

Gaskin also argues that his identity theory takes truth to be an intrinsic property, insofar as it entails that the truth of an atomic proposition does not consist in that proposition’s standing in a relation to some distinct entity x (2021: 182; see also §5.6 of his entry on the identity theory of truth). In this respect, Gaskin’s variety of metaphysical primitivism is notably distinct from the variety that is defended by Merricks (§3.4).

4.2 Primitivism and deflationary theories of truth

A more challenging comparison is that between primitivist and deflationary theories of truth. Deflationists have observed that the traditional project of attempting to uncover the essence of the property truth has yielded little in the way of consensus. They take this to be a strong motivation for abandoning this traditional project and instead regarding truth as being at most a merely insubstantial property. Given this attitude towards truth, deflationists aim instead to identify the signature roles that the concept truth and truth terms play in our cognition and languages.

The comparison between primitivist and deflationary theories is challenging because at first blush, these look like very similar ways of thinking about truth. Primitivists and deflationists both stand in opposition to the traditional project of trying to analyze the nature of truth. As such, both primitivist and deflationary theories seem to entail, in effect, that there isn’t much to say about truth (cp. McGrath 2005: 308). Paul Horwich, a leading deflationist about truth, has even described ‘true’ as a primitive term (Horwich 2010: 80). This raises the question of whether we should think of deflationary and primitivist accounts of truth, truth, and truth terms as really converging on the same set of core ideas.

While primitivist and deflationary theories do exhibit a certain degree of convergence, the extent of this convergence shouldn’t be overstated. Consider truth terms first, focusing in particular on Horwich’s minimalist account of ‘true’. In the passage mentioned above, one of Horwich’s central claims is that ‘true’ cannot be explicitly defined, e.g., using a definition of the following form (see also Horwich 1998: 10–11, 20, 121, 128, §§5, 7, 38, 2010: 6, 15, 22–27, 35, n. 1, 38–40, 42, 82–83, 86, 96, 104):

(Tr): For all x: x is true iff …x…

In this respect, Horwich’s views regarding truth terms converge with a variety of primitivism that was not covered in §2–3, as it is not defended by the main proponents of primitivist theories of truth. This variety of primitivism concerns truth terms, rather than the concept truth or the property truth. According to this view, which we can call term primitivism, the word ‘true’ (and perhaps all other truth terms) is not analyzable in terms of more fundamental linguistic expressions.

However, there is another key respect in which minimalism and term primitivism diverge. Horwich’s view is that when we explain what ‘true’ means, the best strategy is to identify the fact about how ‘true’ is used which explains why it means what it does. According to Horwich, this fact is that the community of speakers who use ‘true’ are disposed to accept every instance of the Equivalence Schema in the absence of supporting evidence:^[9]

(ES): The proposition that p is true iff p.

This leads Horwich to conclude that while ‘true’ cannot be explicitly defined, it can be implicitly defined—namely, by the Equivalence Schema (Horwich 1998: 121).^[10]

It is here that minimalism parts company with term primitivism. (ES) contains the term ‘proposition’, and the minimalist takes (ES) to implicitly define ‘true’. This means that if the minimalist held that the meaning of ‘true’ is more fundamental than that of ‘proposition’, then their implicit definition of ‘true’ would be viciously circular. Being cognizant of this, Horwich argues that the meaning of ‘proposition’ is more fundamental than that of ‘true’ (Horwich 1998: 103, §§22, 32, Postscript §3; see also 2010: 50–53).

Putting the pieces together, this means that while the minimalist denies that ‘true’ is explicitly definable, they nevertheless accept that ‘true’ is implicitly definable in terms of a more fundamental expression—namely, ‘proposition’. Insofar as implicitly defining a term is one (though certainly not the only) way of analyzing it, the minimalist is committed to holding that ‘true’ is analyzable in terms of a more fundamental linguistic expression. In this respect, minimalism and term primitivism are fundamentally at odds. (For a similar observation, see Horwich 1998: 138–139. See Fischer & Zicchetti 2023: 1323 and Nicolai 2021 for further discussion of deflationism and primitivism about truth terms.)

Primitivist and deflationary theories also differ in important ways at both the conceptual and metaphysical levels. Regarding the concept truth, these two sorts of theory converge insofar as they entail that truth cannot be analyzed in terms of concepts like correspondence, coherence, or verifiability. As discussed in §3.7, however, they diverge when it comes to truth’s explanatory power. Primitivists (most notably Davidson and Asay) argue that truth has explanatory power, e.g., in theories of the nature of linguistic meaning or the nature of assertion, whereas deflationists deny that it has such explanatory power (this point is echoed by Candlish & Damnjanovic 2007: §3.8; cf. Fisher 2014: 282).

Turning to truth, deflationists, like primitivists, characteristically hold that truth cannot be defined or analyzed in terms of more fundamental properties or relations (see, e.g., Horwich 1998: 143, 2010: ch. 1, 13, 15–16, 38, 2013: 57, 59; see also Fisher 2014: 283). However, there are at least three significant respects in which deflationary and primitivist theories of truth diverge.

The first is that certain deflationists—including Ayer (1946), Brandom (2005), Grover (1992), Quine (1948, 1970, 1987), Ramsey (1927), and Strawson (1949, 1950)—have denied or else would deny that truth exists. These deflationists—we might call them pure deflationists, since they advocate an eliminative metaphysics of truth—must clearly reject primitivism about truth. This is because primitivism about truth entails that truth does exist. (Cp. Strollo 2023: 925. Merricks 2007: ch. 8, §V emphasizes this difference when arguing that his primitivism is preferable to deflationism. On the relationship between Davidson’s conceptual primitivism and pure deflationism, see Salis 2019).

A second detail to mention is that deflationists who do take truth to exist—we can call them moderate deflationists—characteristically hold that truth lacks explanatory power (see, e.g., Dodd 2000: 133, 149–155; Horwich 1998: Postscript §7; and M. Williams 2002: §5; for further discussion, see Wyatt 2016: §III.3). It is open to a primitivist about truth to deny this claim, much as Davidson and Asay do with regard to the concept truth. This means that when it comes to the choice between primitivism and deflationism about truth, a central consideration is again whether truth has or lacks explanatory power (cp. Edwards 2013: 9; Fisher 2014: 286–287; Strollo 2023: 925–926, §7; and Wyatt 2016: 380–381).

A third key difference is that primitivists and moderate deflationists offer different reasons for thinking that truth cannot be defined or analyzed in terms of more fundamental properties or relations (see Dodd 2000: ch. 5, n. 14, and cp. Fisher 2014: 285–286). The distinctive deflationary reason, due to Horwich (1998: 2–5), is that we can apparently explain the cognitive and linguistic behavior of truth and ‘true’ by supposing that they are mere expressive devices. The specific deflationary claims here are that:

to possess truth/understand the meaning of ‘true’, one must be disposed to accept every instance of (ES) in the absence of supporting evidence and
the primary function of truth and ‘true’ is to enable us to have thoughts and make utterances that we couldn’t otherwise have or make, due to our cognitive and linguistic limitations.

If these claims are correct, Horwich argues (1998: 2), then

[“true”] is not used to attribute to certain entities (i.e. statements, beliefs, etc.) an ordinary sort of property—a characteristic whose underlying nature will account for its relations to other ingredients of reality.

By contrast, the motivations for primitivist theories of truth are quite different. A review of §2.2, §2.3, §3.3, and §3.4 of this entry will make this very apparent. (For more on the differences between primitivist and deflationary theories, see McGrath 1997: 84–85, 2000 [2013: 40] and Sosa 1993a: §D, 2001: §5.)

4.3 Primitivism and axiomatic theories of truth

A final connection to explore is that between primitivist and axiomatic theories of truth. (For discussion of the motivations for and details of various axiomatic theories of truth, see Fujimoto & Halbach 2018; Halbach 2011; and Horsten 2011.) Axiomatic theories of truth concern truth predicates that are meant to apply to sentences of particular formal languages. Unlike traditional theories of truth such as correspondence, coherence, or pragmatic theories, axiomatic theories aren’t founded on the presupposition that these truth predicates are definable. Advocates of axiomatic theories wish to avoid this presupposition in light of Tarski’s theorem concerning the undefinability of truth for certain formal languages (§3.1).

Rather than attempting to define the truth predicates with which they are concerned, advocates of axiomatic theories propose axioms that govern the behavior of these predicates. For instance, suppose that we are interested in offering a theory of truth for an object language L which does not contain any semantic vocabulary. Using corner quotes as a naming device, a particularly straightforward axiom for a truth predicate T that applies only to L-sentences would be (for discussion of axiomatic theories of truth which follow along these basic lines, see Fujimoto & Halbach 2018: §27.4.1; Halbach 2011: ch. 7; and Horsten 2011: ch. 4):

(Dis): For all L-sentences \(\phi\): \(T(\ulcorner\phi\urcorner)\) iff \(\phi\).

In this way, axiomatic theories treat their target truth predicates as primitive predicates. However, it is also important to note that endorsing a particular axiomatic theory of truth doesn’t commit one to holding that the truth predicate that it concerns is undefinable. Kentaro Fujimoto and Volker Halbach (2018: 719) bring this point out particularly well (see also Halbach 2011: 3–4, 7–8):

Axiomatic approaches to truth, knowledge, or other notions do not rule out the possibility of a definition for the notion in question: a notion that is taken as primitive can turn out to be definable after all. On an axiomatic approach, one just does not presuppose that the notion is definable. Once it has been set out what is expected from the notion, one can investigate whether a notion satisfying these conditions is definable or eliminable in some sense.

This fact about axiomatic theories of truth sheds some light on the sense in which they are primitivist theories of truth. Here, it is useful to recall Brons’ contention that Wang Chong was a de facto primitivist (§2.1). The idea is that although Wang never explicitly claims that the concept truth is primitive, this concept nevertheless operates as an undefined concept within his body of thought. If truth so operates, one can endorse all of Wang’s views without committing oneself to the definability of truth. However, that Wang is a de facto primitivist doesn’t entail that anyone who endorses Wang’s views is committed to the undefinability of truth.

The motivations for and details of axiomatic theories of truth are of course very different from Wang’s motivations and the details of his writings. Nevertheless, it is fair to say that axiomatic theories of truth are de facto primitivist theories. In an axiomatic theory of truth, the truth predicates that the theory axiomatizes operate as primitive predicates, but the theory doesn’t entail that these predicates are undefinable. Accordingly, as Fujimoto and Halbach underscore, someone who endorses an axiomatic theory isn’t committed to the definability of the truth predicates that the theory axiomatizes, nor are they are committed to these predicates’ undefinability.

5. Empirical significance: primitivism and false belief attribution

A final issue to consider is the empirical significance of primitivist theories of truth. Conceptual primitivism is particularly relevant here, as it may find support from the extensive body of research on false-belief tasks. (For further discussion, see Nulty 2008 and Ulatowski & Wyatt 2023. On this and other relevant sources of empirical evidence concerning truth, see Asay 2021b: S627–S628, §5, 2024, 2025; Brons 2016: §1; Burge 2018: 425–427; Hinzen 2013; Ulatowski 2017; von Heiseler 2020; Wyatt 2018; and Wyatt & Ulatowski 2024.) False-belief tasks are employed by psychologists to study theory of mind, which is our cognitive capacity to attribute mental states in attempting to make sense of the behavior of agents (cp. Spaulding 2020: 1). In particular, a large number of psychologists have used false-belief tasks to determine when humans, as well as other primates such as great apes, attribute false beliefs (see Ulatowski & Wyatt 2023). In their landmark study, Heinz Wimmer and Josef Perner describe a familiar type of false-belief task as follows (1983: 106):

In order to test subjects’ comprehension of the other person’s wrong belief, stories like the following were constructed: A story character, Maxi, puts chocolate into a cupboard x. In his absence his mother displaces the chocolate from x into cupboard y. Subjects have to indicate the box where Maxi will look for the chocolate when he returns. Only when they are able to represent Maxi’s wrong belief (‘Chocolate is in x’) apart from what they themselves know to be the case (‘Chocolate is in y’) will they be able to point correctly to box x. This procedure tests whether subjects have an explicit and definite representation of the other’s wrong belief. Yet, there is neither a problem in framing the test question by using mental verbs (e.g., ‘What does Maxi believe?’) nor are subjects required to verbalize their knowledge about other’s beliefs since a mere pointing gesture suffices.

The body of evidence from the false-belief task literature seems to bear directly on at least some varieties of conceptual primitivism. Consider, for instance, Asay’s Fundamentality thesis (§3.7). truth is a fundamental concept in Asay’s sense iff truth is either innate or among the initial set of concepts that we acquire in the course of cognitive development. Asay (2020: 106) puts this point crisply when he remarks that

truth is among our most basic and fundamental concepts, a concept without which, as Davidson aptly claims, “we would have no concepts at all” (1996 [2005: 20]).

Thus, if the body of evidence on false-belief tasks strongly supports either of the hypotheses at issue here, then it supports the Fundamentality thesis in turn and to that extent, supports conceptual primitivism.

Our current data should be at least somewhat encouraging to advocates of Fundamentality. Baillargeon, Buttelmann, and Southgate (2018: 112) point out that

[t]here are now over 30 published reports, spanning 11 different methods, providing convergent evidence for false-belief understanding in children ages 6–36 months.

If these studies are on the right track, then it looks as though very young children are able to attribute false beliefs. Since they can attribute false beliefs, it would seem that these children must possess the concept falsity. Moreover, it is highly probable that if they possess falsity, then they also possess truth. So absent compelling counterevidence that children acquire truth in virtue of possessing more fundamental concepts, it can be reasonably inferred that the body of false-belief task evidence supports Fundamentality.

This line of argument seems promising, though properly evaluating it will require attention to a number of issues. One is whether we should follow researchers such as Baillargeon, Buttelmann, and Southgate in offering a mentalistic interpretation of the false-belief task data, according to which they indicate that young children are able to attribute mental states like belief. Tyler Burge (2018) has recently proposed an alternative, non-mentalistic interpretation of the data, and the jury is out on which of these (and a number of other) interpretations is the best (for criticism of Burge’s interpretation, see Carruthers 2020 and Jacob 2020).

Another relevant issue is whether, as Peter Carruthers (2020: §4) has argued, infants can represent beliefs while lacking an explicit—detachable, symbolically represented—concept truth (as well as, presumably, an explicit concept falsity). Carruthers’ proposal suggests that passing some false-belief tasks, e.g., the active helping task used by Buttelmann, Carpenter, and Tomasello (2009), may require possession of truth, whereas passing others, e.g., the change-of-location task of Wimmer and Perner (1983), may not. Accordingly, it may be that only some of the false-belief task data lend support to Fundamentality.

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Primitivist Theories of Truth

1. Concept, property, terms