1. §§2–3 draw and significantly expand upon the discussion in Wyatt (2022: §2).

2. See also Moore (1901–2). Moore (1899: 182) also says that “our conclusion is that truth is itself a simple concept; that it is logically prior to any proposition”, which initially suggests that Moore also takes the concept truth to be primitive. However, we must again remember that the early Moore’s notion of a concept is importantly different from the now standard notion that was detailed in §1.

3. Where we use ‘proposition’, Frege would instead use ‘Thought’ (Gedanke).

4. Similar care must be exercised when considering whether the undefinability theorem motivates a primitivist account of truth terms such as ‘true’ (in §4.2, we will call this view term primitivism). Again, the reason for this is that Tarski’s work on the definability of truth is meant to pertain to formal, rather than natural, languages. Tarski is very clear on this point, writing that

[t]he problem of the definition of truth obtains a precise meaning and can be solved in a rigorous way only for those languages whose structure has been exactly specified. For other languages—thus, for all natural, ‘spoken’ languages—the meaning of the problem is more or less vague, and its solution can have only an approximate character. (1944: 347)

5. (4) is presumably meant to be an implicit definition of truth. For more on implicit definitions, see §2.6 of the entry on definitions. Also, I have slightly modified McGinn’s proposed definition to ensure that it is grammatical.

6. One might also be a deflationist about truth terms; §4.2 discusses this sort of deflationism.

7. Another striking thesis that Asay (2021b) defends is that truth is the ability to have propositional thoughts. He motivates this view using his Omnipresence thesis, so it is fair to regard the latter as a core thesis of primitivist deflationism, whereas the former is a derivative component of the view. For further discussion of the view that concepts are abilities, see Bulov (2023).

8. Asay (2021b: S617) calls these “subject matter” components; cp. 2021a: 533.

9. Horwich (2010: 42, 47–48, ch. 3, n. 10) later revises this view in several respects, but it isn’t essential to mention these refinements here.

10. Note that Horwich’s proposed implicit definition of ‘true’ is importantly different from McGinn’s (§3.3). A key difference is that whereas the right-hand side of McGinn’s definition (4) mentions a proposition’s ‘having the self-effacing property,’ the right-hand side of Horwich’s definition doesn’t mention a property that is had by a proposition. Indeed, the right-hand side of Horwich’s definition doesn’t mention propositions at all (though, of course, the right-hand sides of some of (ES)’s instances do mention propositions, e.g. ‘the proposition that all propositions are green is true iff all propositions are green’). Thus, while McGinn’s definition is inspired by (ES), it departs from (ES) in significant ways.