The Theory of Two Truths in India

First published Thu Feb 17, 2011; substantive revision Mon May 16, 2022

The theory of the two truths has a twenty-five century long history behind it. It has its origin in the sixth century BCE^[1] India with the emergence of the Siddhārtha Gautama. It is said, according to the Pitāpūtrasamāgama-sūtra, Siddhārtha became a buddha “awakened one” because he fully understood the meaning of the two truths—conventional truth (saṁvṛti-satya) and ultimate truth (paramārtha-satya)—and that the reality of all the objects of knowledge, the text says, is exhaustively comprised of the two truths (Sde Dge, dkon brtsegs nga, 60b). The theory of the two truths, according to the Samādhirāja-sūtra, is a unique contribution made by the Buddha towards Indian philosophy. This text states: “the knower of the world, without hearing it from others, taught that there are the two truths” (Sde dge, mdo-sde da 174b–210b). Nāgārjuna, in his Mūlamadhyamakakārikā [MMK], attributes the two truths to the Buddha as follows: “the Dharma taught by the buddhas is precisely based on the two truths: a truth of mundane conventions and a truth of the ultimate” ([MMK] 24:8).

The Madhyamaka philosophers claim the theory of the two truths is the heart of the Buddha’s philosophy. According to them, it serves as the mirror reflecting the core message of the Buddha’s teachings and the massive philosophical literature it inspired. At the heart of the theory of the two truths is the Buddha’s ever poignant existential and soteriological concerns about the reality of things and of life. Nirvāṇ ultimate freedom from the suffering conditioned by desires, is only ever achieved, according to the theory of the two truths, from a correct understanding of two truths. Knowledge of the conventional truth informs us how things are conventional, from the ordinary commonsense perspective and thus grounds our epistemic practice in its proper linguistic and conceptual conventional framework. Knowledge of the ultimate truth informs us of how things really are ultimate, from the ultimate analytical perspective and so takes our minds beyond the bounds of conceptual and linguistic conventions.

In the theory of the two truths, as we know it today, maybe unknown to the earliest start of Buddhist thought in India. Contemporary scholarship suggests that the Buddha himself may not have made any explicit reference to the two truths. The early textual materials such as Pali Nikāyas and āgamas ascribe to the Buddha does not make explicit mention of the distinction of the two truths. Recent studies also suggest that the two truths distinction is an innovation on the part of the Abhidhamma which came into prominence originally as a heuristic device, useful for later interpreters to reconcile apparent inconsistent statements in the Buddha’s teachings (Karunadasa, 2006: 1; 1996: 25–6 and n.139, The Cowherds, 2011; 5). This distinction is however not entirely disconnected from the Buddha’s teachings. The antecedent hermeneutic distinctions drawn in the Aṅguttara Nikāya (AN II.60) between two linguistic concepts (paññatti) – nitattha (Skt. nitārtha) and neyyatta (Skt. neyārtha) – provides us with a useful insight into the rationale basis from which later develops the formulation of the two truths distinction. This latter pair of terms deals with the hermeneutic strategies explaining the purported meaning of the Buddhist scriptural statements. Nitattha is a statement the meaning of which is “drawn out” (nita-attha), definitive and explicit, taken as its stands, and neyyattha is a statement the meaning of which is “to be drawn out” (neyya-attha) and interpretive (Karunadasa, 1996: 25). The commentary (Aṅguttaranikāya Aṭṭhakatah II.118) on the Aṅguttara Nikāya II.60 explores nitattha/neyyattha distinction’s connection with the sammuti/paramattha distinction. This simple heuristic device however stimulated rich philosophical exchanges amongst the Buddhist philosophers and practitioners, not to mention the exchanges with traditional Hindu thinkers. The exchange of different ideas and views of the two truths between the early Buddhists, among other factors, gave birth to Buddhism as the philosophy we know today. The transformation of the two truths theory from a simple hermeneutic strategy to a complex system of thought with highly sophisticated ontological, epistemological and semantic theories blurring a clear methodological distinction between “reality” and “truth”. As always two terms – reality and truth – are expressed with one Sanskrit term satya; often reality/truth is seen as having an interchangeable usage and meaning. This philosophical development is perhaps the most significant contribution resulting from the schisms the Buddhism experienced after the Buddha passed away (ca. 380 BCE). Various schools with varying interpretations of the Buddha’s words soon appeared in Buddhism, which resulted in a rich and vibrant philosophical and hermeneutic atmosphere.

In later years, Sarvāstivādin (Vaibhāṣika) and Sautrāntika, Madhyamaka (from the first century CE onwards) and Yogācāra (ca. sixth century CE onwards) became the dominant schools. Our investigation of the theory of the two truths will briefly focus on how these schools have received, interpreted and understood it. Although all these schools regard the theory of two truths as the centrepiece of the Buddha’s philosophy, all have nevertheless adopted very different approaches to the theory. As we shall see each understood and interpreted the two truths in different ways, and are often fundamentally and radically opposed to each other.

1. Ābhidharmikas / Sarvāstivāda (Vaibhāṣika)

In the fourth century, Vasubandhu undertook a comprehensive survey of the Sarvāstivāda School’s thought, and wrote a compendium, Treasury of Knowledge, (Abhidharmakośakārikā [AK]; Mngon pa ku 1b–25a) with his own Commentary on the Treasury of Knowledge (Abhidharmakośabhāṣya [AKB], Mngon pa ku 26b–258a). This commentary not only offers an excellent account of the Sarvāstivādin views, including the theory of the two truths, but also offers a sharp critique of many views held by the Sarvāstivādins. Vasubandhu based his commentary on the Mahāvibhāṣā (The Great Commentary), as the Sarvāstivādins held their philosophical positions according to the teachings of the Mahāvibhāṣā. Consequently, Sarvāstivādins are often known as Vaibhāṣikas.

The Sarvāstivādin’s ontology^[2] or the theory of the two truths makes two fundamental claims.

the claim that the ultimate reality consists of irreducible spatial units (e.g., atoms of the material category) and irreducible temporal units (e.g., point-instant consciousnesses) of the five basic categories, and
the claim that the conventional reality consists of reducible spatial wholes or temporal continua.

To put the matter straightforwardly, for the Sarvāstivādins, wholes and continua are only conventionally real, whereas the atoms and point-instant consciousness are only ultimately real.

1.1 Conventional truth

To see how the Sarvāstivādins defend these two claims, we shall have a close look at their definitions of the two truths. We will examine conventional truth first. This will provide the argument in support of the second claim. In the Abhidharmakośa Vasubandu defines conventional truth/reality as follows: “An entity, the cognition of which does not arise when it is destroyed and, mentally divided, is conventionally existent like a pot and water. Ultimate existence is otherwise.” ([AK] 6.4, Mngon pa khu 7ab) Whatever is, on this definition, designated as “conventionally existent” is taken to be “conventionally real” or conventional truth when the idea or concept of which ceases to arise when it is physically destroyed, by means of a hammer for instance. Or its properties such as shape are stripped away from it by means of subjecting it under analysis, thereby conceptually excluding them. A pot and water are designated as conventionally existent therefore conventionally real for the concept “pot” ceases to exist when it is destroyed physically, and the concept “water” no longer arises when we conceptually exclude from it its shape, colour etc.

On the Sarvāstivādin definition, for an entity to be real, it does not need to be ultimately real, exclusively. For a thing to be ultimately real is for that thing to be “foundationally existent” (dravya-sat / rdzas yod)^[3] in contrast with being “compositely existent” (avayavidravya / rdzas grub). By “foundationally existent” the Sarvāstivādin refer to the entity which is fundamentally real, the concept or the cognition of which is not dependent on conceptual construction, hence not conceptually existent (prajñaptisat) nor a composition of the aggregative phenomena. In the case of foundational existent there always remains something irreducible to which the concept of the thing applies, hence it is ultimately real. A simple entity is not reducible to conceptual forms, or conventional designations, nor is it compositely existent entity. We will have lot more to say on this point shortly.

Pot and water are not the foundational entities. They are rather composite entities (avayavi-dravya / rdzas grub). By composite entity, we mean an entity or existent which is not fundamental, primary or simple, but is rather a conceptually constructed (prajñaptisat), composition of various properties, and is thus reducible both physically and logically.

Hence for the Sarvāstivādin, conventional reality (samvṛtisatya), composite-existence (avayavi-dravya / rdzas grub), and the lack of intrinsic reality (niḥsvabhāva) are all equivalents. A conventional reality is therefore characterised as a reducible conventional entity on three grounds: (i) conventional reality is both physically and logically reducible, as it disintegrates when it is subjected to physical destruction and disappears from our minds when its parts are separated from it by logical analysis; (ii) conventional reality borrows its identity from other things including its parts, concepts etc., it does not exist independently in virtue of its intrinsic reality (niḥsvabhāva), the exclusion of its parts and concepts thus affects and reduces its inherent nature; and (iii) conventional reality is a product of mental constructions, like that of conventionally real wholes, causation, continuum etc, and it does not exists intrinsically.

1.2 Ultimate truth

The definition of the ultimate reality, as we shall see, offers the Sarvāstivādin response to the claim that ultimate reality consists of irreducible atoms and point-instant moments. In glossing the [AK] 6.4 verse his commentary explains that ultimate reality is regarded as ultimately existent, one that is both physically and logically irreducible. Vasubandhu supplies three arguments to support this: (i) ultimate reality is both physically and logically irreducible, as it does not disintegrate when it is subjected to physical destruction and that its identity does not disappear when its parts are separated from it under logical analysis; and (ii) ultimate reality does not borrow its nature from other things including its parts. Rather it exists independently in virtue of its intrinsic reality (svabhāva), the exclusion of its parts thus does not affect its inherent nature; and (iii) it is not a product of mental constructions, like that of conventionally real wholes, causation, continuum etc. It exists intrinsically ([AKB] 6.4, Mngon pa khu 214a).

Ultimate reality is of two types: the compounded (saṁskṛta) ultimate, and the uncompounded (asaṁskṛta) ultimate. The uncompounded ultimate consists of (a) space (akāśa), and (b) nirvāṇa—analytical cessation (pratisaṁkyā-nirodha) and non-analytical cessation (apratisaṁkhyā-nirodha). These three ultimates are uncompounded as each is seen as being causally unconditioned. They are nonspatial concepts. These concepts do not have any physical referent whatsoever. Space is a mere absence of entity. Analytical and nonanalytical cessations are the two forms of nirvāṇa, which is simply freedom from afflictive suffering, or the elimination of afflictive suffering. These concepts are not associated in positing any thing that can be described as remotely physical. They are thus the concepts that are irreducible physically and logically.

The compounded ultimate consists of the five aggregates—material aggregate (rūpa), feeling aggregate (vedanā), perception-aggregate (saṁjñā), dispositional aggregate (saṁskāra), and consciousness-aggregate (vijñāna)—since they are causally produced, and the ideas of each aggregate are conceived individually rather than collectively. If the aggregates, the ideas of which are conceived collectively as a whole(s) or a continuum/continua, they could not be ultimately real. The collective concepts of the aggregate as a “whole” or as a “continuum” subject to cessation as they cease to appear to the mind, get excluded from the conceptual framework of the reality of the five aggregates when they are logically analysed.

2. Sautrāntika

The philosophers^[4] who championed this view are some of the best-known Indian logicians and epistemologists. Other great names who propogated the tradition include Devendrabuddhi (?), Śākhyabuddhi (?), Vinitadeva (630–700), Dharmottara (750–810), Mokṣakaragupt (ca. 1100–1200). Dignāga (480–540) and Dharmakīrti (600–660) are credited to have founded this school. For the theory of the two truths in the Sautrāntika we will need to rely on the following texts:

Dignāga’s Compendium of Epistemology (Pramāṇasamuccaya, Tshad ma ce 1b–13a),
Dignāga’s Auto-commentary on the Compendium of Epistemology (Pramāṇasamuccayavṛtti, Tshad ma ce 14b–85b),
Dharmakīrti’s Verses on Epistemology (Pramāṇavārttikakārikā [PVK]; tshad ma ce 94b–151a),
Dharmakīrti’s Commentary on the Verses of Epistemology (Pramāṇavārttikavṛtti [PVT]; tshad ma ce 261b–365a),
Dharmakīrti’s Ascertainment of Epistemology (Pramāṇaviniścaya, tshad ma ce 152b–230a),
Dharmakīrti’s Dose of Logical Reasoning (Nyāyabindu, tshad ma ce 231b–238a).

Broadly, all objects of knowledge are classified into two realities based on the ways in which right-cognition (pramāṇa) engages with its object. They are either directly accessible (pratyakṣa), which constitutes objects that are obvious to cognition, or they are directly inaccessible (parokṣa), which constitutes objects that are occulted, or obscured from cognition. A directly accessible object is principally known by a direct perceptual right-cognition (pratyaṣa-pramāṇa), whereas a directly inaccessible object is principally known by an inferential right-cognition (anumāna-pramāṇa).

2.1 Ultimate truth

Of the two types of objects, some are ultimately real while others are only conventionally real, and some are not even conventionally real, they are just unreal, or fictions. In defining ultimate truth in the Sautrāntika tradition, we read in Dharmakīrti’s Verses on Epistemology: “That which is ultimately causally efficient is here an ultimately existent (paramārthasat). Conventionally existent (saṁvṛtisat) is otherwise. They are declared as the definitions of the unique particular (svalakṣaṇa) and the universal (sāmāṅyalakṣaṇa)” (Dharmakīrti [PVK] Tshad ma ce 118b).

Ultimate truth is, on this definition, a phenomenon (dharma) that is ultimately existent, and ultimately existent are ultimately causally efficient. Phenomenon that is ultimately causally efficient is intrinsically or objectively real, existing in and of itself as a “unique particular” (svalakṣaṇa).^[5] By “unique particular” Dharmakīrti means ultimately real phenomenon—dharma that is self-defined, uniquely individual, objectively real, existing independent of any conceptual fabrication, ultimately causally efficient (artha), a dharma which serves as an objects of direct perception, dharma that presents itself to the cognitions as distinctive/unique individuals.

In the Commentary on the Verses of Epistemology, Dharmakīrti characterises (Tshad ma ce 274b–279b) all ultimately real unique particulars exist as distinct individuals with their own intrinsic natures. And they satisfy three criteria:

They have determinate spatial locations (deśaniyata / yul nges pa) of their own, as real things do not have a shared property amongst themselves. The real fire we see is either near or far, or at the left or the right, or at the back or in the front. By contrast, the universal fireness^[6], that is, the concept of being a fire, does not occupy a determinate position.
Unique particulars are temporally determinate (kālaniyata / dus nges pa or dus ma ‘dres pa). They are only momentary instants. They spontaneously go out of existence the moment they have come into existence. This is not the case with the universals. Being purely conceptually constructed, they remain uninfluenced by the dynamism of causal conditions and hence are not affected by time.
Unique particulars are ontologically determinate (ākāraniyata / ngo bo nges pa / ngo bo ma ‘dres pa) as they are causally conditioned; the effects of the aggregation of the causal conditions that have the ability to produce them. When those causal conditions come together at certain points in time, unique particulars come into existence. When those conditions disintegrate and are not replaced by new conditions, unique particulars go out of existence. When the conditions have not yet come together, unique particulars are yet to obtain their ontological status.

So “determinate intrinsic natures of the unique particulars,” Dharmakīrti argues in Commentary on the Verses of Epistemology, “are not accidental or fortuitous since what is not determinate cannot be spatially, temporally and ontologically determinate” (Tshad ma ce 179a).

The unique particulars are, Sautrāntika claims, ultimately real, and they supply us four arguments to support the claim:

(1) Unique particulars are causally efficient phenomena (arthakriyāsamartha) ([PVT] Tshad ma ce 179a) because: (a) they have ability to serve pragmatic purpose of life—fulfil the objectives in our life, and (b) ability to produce a variety of cognitive images due to their remoteness or proximity. (Dharmottara’s Nyābinduṭīkā Tshad ma we 36b–92a) Both of these abilities must be associated exclusively with objects of direct perception (Tshad ma we 45a).

(2) Unique particulars present themselves only to a direct perceptual cognition as distinct and uniquely defined individuals because unique particulars are, as Dharmakīrti’s Nyāyabindu points out “the objects whose nearness or remoteness presents the difference of cognitive image” (Tshad ma ce 231a) and that object alone which produces the impression of vividness according to its remoteness or proximity, exists ultimately (DharmottaraTshad ma we 44b–45a).

(3) Unique particulars are not denotable by language since they are beyond the full grasp of any conceptual mind (śabdasyāviśaya). Although unique particulars are objective references of language and thought, and we may have firm beliefs about them, conceptual mind does not fully grasp their real nature. They are ultimately real, directly cognisable by means of certain perceptions without reliance on other factors (nimitta) such as language and thought. Therefore they must exist. They are the sorts of phenomena whose cognition would not occur if they are not objectively real.

In the Sautrāntika ontology ultimately real/existent (synonymous) unique particulars are classified into three kinds:

momentary instants of matter (rūpa),
momentary instants of consciousness (vijñāna) and
momentary instants of the non-associated composite phenomena, which are neither matter nor minds or mental factors (citta-caitta-viprayukta-saṃskāra).

The Sautrāntika’s theory of ultimate truth mirrors its ontology of flux in which unique particulars are viewed as spatially infinitesimal atoms constituting temporally momentary events (kṣaṇika) or as successive flashes of consciousnesses, cognitive events, all devoid of any real continuity as substratum. Unique particulars are ultimately real, although they are not enduring substances (dravyas) inhering in it’s qualities (guṇas) and actions (karmas) as the Naiyāyika-Vaiśeṣika claims. They are rather bundles of events arising and disappearing instantly. Even continuity of things and motion are only successive events closely resembling each other. On this theory ultimate realities are momentary point instants, and Vasubandhu and Dharmakīrti both argue that no conditioned phenomenon, therefore, no ultimately real unique particulars, endure more than a single moment—hence they are momentary instants (kṣaṇika).

Four closely interrelated arguments provide the defence of the Sautrāntika’s claim that ultimately real unique particulars are momentary instants. Vasubandhu and Dharmakīrti both employ the first two arguments. The third argument is one Dharmakīrti specialises in his works.

(1) Ultimately real unique particulars are momentary instants because their perishing or destruction is spontaneous to their becoming. This follows because (i) unique particulars are inherently self-destructive (Vasubandhu [AKB], Mngon pa khu 166b–167a), and (ii) their perishing or cessation is intrinsic and does not depend on any other extrinsic causal factors (Dharmakīrti, [PVK] Tshad ma ce 102a; [PVT], Tshad ma ce 178ab).

(2) The ultimately real unique particulars are momentary instants because they are motionless, and do not move from one temporal or spatial location to another. They perish just where they were born since nothing exists later than its acquisition of existence (Vasubandhu [AKB] Mngon pa khu 166b).

(3) The third argument proves momentary instants of unique particulars from the inference of existence (sattvānumāna). This is a case of the argument from identity of existence and production (svabhāvahetu). All unique particulars which are ultimately existent, are necessarily produced, since only those that are ultimately existent, insofar as Dharmakīriti is concerned, are able to a perform causal function—i.e., to produce effects. And causally efficient unique particulars imply constant change for the renewal and the perishing of their antecedent identities, therefore, they are momentary.

Finally (4), unique particulars are ultimately real not only on the ground that they constitute the final ontological status, but also because it forms the basis of the Sautrāntika soteriology. The attainment of nirvāṇa — the ultimate freedom from the afflictions of life—for the Sautrāntika, according to Dharmakīrti’s Vādanyāya, has an immediate perception of the unique particulars as its necessary condition (Tshad ma che 108b–109a).

2.2 Conventional truth

Dharmakīrti defines conventional truth, in his [PVK], as dharma which is “conventionally existent” and he identifies conventional truth with the “universal” (sāmānya-lakṣaṇa)^[7] just as he identifies ultimate truth with unique particular (Tshad ma ce 118b). When a Sautrāntika philosopher describes a certain entity as a universal, he means a conceptual entity not apprehended by virtue of its own being. He means a general property that is conceptually constructed, appearing to be something common amongst all items in a certain class of objects. Unlike Nyāya-Vaiśeṣika view where universals are regarded as objectively real and eternal entities inhering in substances, qualities and particulars, universals, for the Sautrāntika are pure conceptual constructs. Sautrāntika holds the view known as nominalism or conceptualism—the view that denies universals any independent extramental objective reality existing on their own apart from being mentally constructed.

While unique particulars exist independently of linguistic convention, universals have no reality in isolation from linguistic and conceptual conventions. Thus, universals and ultimate reality are mutually exclusive. Universals are therefore only conventionally real, lacking any intrinsic nature, whereas unique particulars are ultimately real, and exist intrinsically.

The Sautrāntika defends the claim that universals (sāmānya-lakṣaṇa) are only conventional reality for the following reasons (tshad ma ce 118b):

Universals are domains of inferential cognition since they are exhaustively grasped by conceptual mind by means of language and thought (Dharmakīrti, Nyāyabindu, tshad ma ce 231a).
Universals are objects of the apprehending cognition which arises simply out of having beliefs about the objects without the need to see any real object.
Universals are causally inefficient. By “causal inefficiency,” the Sautrāntika, according to Dharmottara’s Nyāyabinduṭīkā, (Tshad ma we 45ab) means three things: (a) universals are purely conceptually constructed, hence unreal; (b) universals are unable to serve a pragmatic purpose as they do not fulfil life’s objectives; and (c) cognitive images produced by universals are independent of the proximity between objects and their cognitions since production of image does not require seeing the object as it is in the case of perception and unique particulars.
Universals are products of unifying or mixing of language and their referential objects (unique particulars), and thus appearing them to conceptual minds as generalities, unified wholes, unity, continuity, as phenomena that appear to conceptual mind to having shared properties linking with all items in the same class of objects.
Universals, consequently, obscure the individualities of unique particulars from being directly apprehended. This is because, as we have already seen, universals, according to Dharmakīrti’s [PVK] (Tshad ma ce 97ab) and [PVT] (Tshad ma ce 282ab), are only conventionally real since they are conceptual constructs founded on unifying and putting together the distinct individualities of unique particulars as having one common property being shared by all items in the same class.

According to the Sautrāntika philosophy, language does not describe reality or unique particulars positively through real universals as suggested by the Naiyāyikas. The Sautrāntika developed an alternative nominalist theory of universal called the apoha-theory in which language is seen to engage with reality negatively by means of elimination or exclusion of the other (anyāpoha / gzhan sel). On this theory, the function of language, specifically naming, is to eliminate object from the class of those objects to which language does not apply.

In brief the Sautrāntika’s theory of the two truths rests on dichotomising objects between unique particulars, which are understood as ultimately reals, dynamic, momentary, causally effective, the objective domain of the direct perception; and universals, which are understood as only conventionally reals, conceptually constructed, static, causally ineffective and the objective domain of the inferential cognition.

3. Yogācāra

The Vaibhāṣika’s realistic theory of the two truths and the Sautrāntika’s representationalist theory of the two truths both affirm the ultimate reality of physical objects constituted by atoms. The Yogācāra rejects physical realism of both the Vaibhāṣika and the Sautrāntika, although it agrees with the Sautrāntika’s representationalist theory as far as they both affirm representation as the intentional objects in perception and deny in perception a direct access to any external object. Where they part their company is in their response to the questions: what causes representations? Is the contact of senses with physical objects necessary to give rise to representations in perception? The Sautrāntika’s reply is that external objects cause representations, given that these representations are intentional objects there is indeed a contact between senses and external objects. This affirmative response allows the Sautrāntika to affirm reality of external objects. The Yogācārin however replies that “subliminal impressions” (vāsanās) from foundational consciousness (ālayavijñāna) are the causes of the mental representations, and given that these impressions are only internal phenomena acting as intentional objects, the contact between senses and external objects is therefore rejected even conventionally. This allows the Yogācārin to deny even conventional reality of all physical objects, and argue that all conventional realities are our mental representations, mental creations, cognitions etc.

The central thesis in the Yogācāra philosophy, the theory of the two truths echoes is the assertion that all that is conventionally real is only ideas, representations, images, creations of the mind, and that there is no conventionally real object that exists outside the mind to which it corresponds. These ideas are only objects of any cognition. The whole universe is a mental universe. All physical objects are only fiction, they are unreal even by the conventional standard, similar to a dream, a mirage, a magical illusion, where what we perceive are only products of our mind, without a real external existence.

Inspired by the idealistic tendencies of various sūtras consisting of important elements of the idealistic doctrines, in the third and the fourth centuries many Indian philosophers developed and systematised a coherent Idealist School. In the beginning of the Viṃśatikā Vasubandhu treats citta, manas, vijñāna, vijñāpti as synonymous and uses these terms as the names of the idealistic school. The chief founders were Maitreyanāth (ca. 300) and Asaṅga (315–390), propagated by Vasubandhu (320–380), Dignāga (480–540) Sthiramati (ca. 500), Dharmapāla (530–561), Hiuan-tsang (602–664), Dharmakīrti (600–660), Śāntarakṣita (ca.725–788) and Kamalaśīla (ca.740–795). The last two are Yogācāra-Mādhyamikas in contrast with the earlier figures who are identified as Yogācārins.

Like other Buddhist schools, the theory of the two truths captures the central Yogācāra doctrines. Maitreyanāth asserts in his Verses on the Distinction Between Phenomena and Reality (Dharmadharmatāvibhaṅga-kārikā, DDVK; Sems tsam phi 50b–53b)—“All this is understood to be condensed in two categories: phenomena (dharma) and reality (dharmatā) because they encompass all.” (DDVK 2, Sems tsam phi) By “All” Yogācārin means every possible object of knowledge, and they are said to be contained in the two truths since objects are either conventional truth or ultimate truth. Things are either objects of conventional knowledge or objects of ultimate knowledge, and a third category is not admitted.

3.1 Conventional Truth

Etymologically the term conventional truth covers the sense of what we ordinarily take as commonsensical truths. However, in contrast with naïve realism associated with common sense notions of truths, for the Yogācāra the term “conventional truth” has somewhat a negative connotation. It exclusively refers to objects of knowledge like forms, sound etc., the mode of existence or mode of being which radically contradicts with the mode of its appearance, and thus they are false, unreal, and deceptive. Forms, sounds, etc., are defined as conventional entities in that they are realities from the perspective of, or by the force of, three forms of convention:

fabrication (asatkalpita),
consciousness (vijñāna), or
language, signifier, a convenient designator (śabda).

A conventional truth is therefore a truth by virtue of being fabricated by the conceptual mind; or it is truth erroneously apprehended by means of the dualistic consciousness; or it is true concept, meaning, signified and designated by a convenient designator/signifier.

Because the Yogācārins admit three conventions, it also admits three categories of conventional truths:

fabricated phenomena;
mind/consciousness; and
language since conventional truths exist due to the force of these three conventions.

The first and the last are categories of imaginary phenomena (parikalpita) and the second is dependent phenomena (paratantra).

The Yogācāra’s claim that external objects are not even conventionally real, what is conventionally real are only our impressions, and mental representations is one Vasubandhu closely defends by means of the Yogācāra’s theory of the three natures (trisvabhāva). In his Discernment of the Three Natures (Trisvabhāvakārikā, or Trisvabhāvanirdeśa [TSN]; Sems tsam shi 10a–11b), Vasubandhu explains that the Yogācāra ontology and phenomenology as consisting of the unity of three natures (svabhāva):

the dependent or other (paratantra);
the imaginary / conceptual (parikalpita); and
the perfect / ultimate (pariniṣpanna) ([TSN] 1, Sems tsam shi 10a)

The first two account for conventional truth and the latter ultimate truth. We shall consider the import of the three in turn.

First, Vasubandhu defines the dependent nature as: (a) one that exists due to being causally conditioned (pratyayādhīnavṛttitvāt), and (b) it is the basis of “what appears” (yat khyāti) mistakenly in our cognition as conventionally real, it is the basis for the “unreal conceptual fabrication” (asatkalpa) which is the phenomenological basis of the appearance of reified subjects and objects ([TSN] 2 Sems tsam shi 10a). The implications of the Yogācārin expression “what appears” to describe the dependent nature are therefore twofold: (a) that the things that appear in our cognitions are exclusively the representations, which are the manifest forms of the subliminal impressions, and (b) that the entire web of conventional reality, which presents itself to our cognitions phenomenologically in various ways, is exclusively the appearance of those representations. Apart from those representations, consciousnesses, which appear to be external objects, there is no conventionally real external content which corresponds to what appears.

Second, in contrast with the dependent nature which is the basis of “what appears” (yat khyāti), the imaginary nature (parikalpita), as Vasubandu defines it, is the mode of appearance “as it appears” (sau yathā khyāti) on the ground that its existence is only an “unreal conceptual fabrication” (asatakalpo) ([TSN] 2, Sems tsam chi 10a). The imaginary nature is only an “unreal conceptual construction” because of two reasons: (i) it is the dependent nature—representations—merely dually reified by the mind as an ultimately real subject, or self, or eg, and (ii) the imaginary nature is dualistic reification of beings and objects as existing really and externally, there is no such reality.

Third, given the fact that the dependent nature is devoid, or free from this duality, the imaginary nature is a mere superimposition on it. Hence nonduality, the perfect nature (pariniṣpanna) is ultimate reality of the dependent nature.

3.2 Ultimate truth

In the Commentary on the Sūtra of Intent (Ārya-saṃdhinirmocana-sūtra, Mdo sde ca 1b–55b) it is stated that “Reality as it is, which is the intentional object of a pure consciousness, is the definition of the perfect nature. This must be so because it is with respect to this that the Victorious Buddha attributed all phenomena as natureless, ultimately.” (Mdo sde ca 35b) Vasubandhu’s [TSN] defines “the perfect nature (pariniṣpanna) as the eternal nonexistence of ‘as it appears’ of ‘what appears’ because it is unalterable.” ([TSN] 3, Sems tsam chi 10a) “What appears” is the dependent nature—a series of cognitive events, the representations. “As it appears” is the imaginary nature—the unreal conceptual fabrication of the subject-object duality. The representations, (i.e., the dependent nature) appear in the cognition as if they have in them the subject-object duality, even though the dependent nature is wholly devoid of such subject-object duality. The perfect nature is therefore this eternal nonexistence of the imaginary nature—the duality—in the dependent nature.

Vasubandhu defines the perfect nature as the ultimate truth and identifies it with mere-consciousness. “This is the ultimate (paramārtha) of the dharmas, and so it is the reality (tathatā) too. Because its reality is like this all the time, it is mere consciousness.” (Triṃ 25, Sems tsam shi 3b) Accordingly Sthiramati’s Commentary on the Thirty Verses (Triṃśikābhāṣya [TriṃB], Sems tsam shi 146b–171b), explains “ultimate” (paramārtha) here as referring to “’ world-transcending knowledge’ (lokottara-nirvikalpa-jñāna) in that there is nothing that surpasses it. Since it is the object of [the transcendent knowledge], it is the ultimate. It is even like the space in having the same taste everywhere. It is the perfect nature, which is stainless and unchangable. Therefore, it is known as the ‘ultimate.’” ([TriṃB], Sems tsam shi 169ab)

So, as we can see the dependent and the imaginary natures together explain the Yogācāra’s conventional reality and the perfect nature explains its conception of the ultimate reality. The first two natures provide an argument for the Yogācāra’s empirical and practical standpoints (vyavahāra), conventional truth and the third nature an argument for its ultimate truth. Even then the dependent nature alone is conventionally real and the perfect nature alone is ultimately real. By contrast, the imaginary nature is unreal and false even by the empirical and practical standards. This is true in spite of the fact the imaginary nature is constitutive of the conventional truth.

So, the perfect nature—nondual mind, i.e., emptiness (śūnyatā) of the subject-object duality—is the ultimate reality of the Yogācāra conception. Ultimate truth takes various forms as it is understood within the Yogācārin tradition. As Maitreyanātha states, ultimate truth takes three primary forms—as emptiness it is the ultimate object, as nirvāṇa it is the ultimate attainment, and as nonconceptual knowledge it is the ultimate realization ([MVK], Sems tsam phi 42B).

Yogācāra Arguments

The core argument in support of the only mind thesis is the impossibility of the existence of external objects. Vasubandhu develops this argument in his Viṃ 1–27 as does Dignāga in his Examination of the Intentional Object (Ālambanaparīkṣāvṛtti, ĀPV 1–8, Tshad ma ce 86a–87b) against the atomists (Naiyāyikas-Vaiśeṣika and Ābhidharmikas^[8]). Against the Yogācāra idealist thesis the realist opponents, as Vasubandhu observes, raise three objections:—“If consciousness (does) not (arise) out from an object (i) neither the determination or certainty (niyama) in regard to place (deśa) and time (kāla), (ii) nor the indetermination or unexclusiveness (aniyama) in regard to the series of (consciousness) (iii) nor the performance of the (specific) function (kṛtyakriya) are logically possible (yuktā)” (Viṁ 2, Sems tsam shi 3a).

Vasubandhu offers his Yogācāra reply in the Viṃ to these realist objections and insists that the idealist position does not face these three problems. The first problem is not an issue for the Yogācāra since dreams (svapna) account for the spatio-temporal determination. In dreams, in the absence of an external object, one still has the cognition of a woman, or a man in only determinate / specific time and place, and not arbitrarily and not everywhere and not in any moment. Neither is the second problem of the lack of an intersubjective agreement an issue for the Yogācāra. The case of the pretas (hungry-ghosts) account for intersubjective agreement as they look at water they alone, not other beings, see rivers of pus, urine, excrement, and collectively hallucinates demons as the hell guardians. Although pus, urine, excrement and hell guardians are nonexistent externally, due to the maturation of their collective karma, pretas exclusively experience the series of cognitions (vijñapti), other beings do not encounter such experience (Viṃ 3, Sems tsam shi). Nor is the lack of causal efficacy of the impressions or representations in the consciousness a problem for the Yogācāra. As in the case of wet dreams, even without a union of the couple, the emission of semen can occur, and so the representations in the consciousness are causally efficient even without the externally real object.

Yogācāra’s defensive arguments against the realist challenges are quite strong. However unless Yogācāra is able to undermine the core realist thesis—i.e., reality of the external objects—and its key supporting argument—the existence of atoms—then the debate could go either way. Therefore Yogācāra shows the nonexistence, or unreality of the atoms as the basis of the external object to reject the realist position.

Yogācāra’s impressions-only theory and the Sautrāntika’s representationalist theory both explain our sensory experience (the spatio-temporal determinacy, intersubjective agreement, and causal efficacy). They agree on what the observables are: mental entities, including mental images but also emotions such as desires. They also agree that karma plays vital role in explaining our experience. The realist theory, though, according to Dignāga’s Investigation About the Support of the Cognition (Ālambanaparīkṣāvṛ tti [ĀlamPV]) has to posit the reality of additional physical objects, things that are in principle unobservable, given that all we experience in the cognition are our impressions ([ĀlamPV], Tshad ma ce 86a).

If the realist thesis were correct, then there would be three alternatives for the atoms to act as the intentional objects of cognition.

Atoms of the things would be either one in the way the Nyya-Vaieika conceives the whole as something constituted by parts but being single, one, different from the parts that compose it, and having a real existence apart from the existence of the parts. Or
things would have to be constituted by multiple atoms i.e., a number or a group of atoms coexisting one besides the other without forming a composite whole as a result of mutual cohesion between the atoms. Or
things would have to be atoms grouped together, massed together as a unity among themselves with a tight cohesion. Yogācāra contends that these are the only three alternatives in which the reality of the external objects can functioning as the objects of cognition.

Of the three alternatives: (1) points to the unity of a thing conceived as a whole; and (2) and (3) point to the multiplicity looking at the things as loose atoms, i.e., composite atoms. Not one of the three possibilities is, on Yogācāra’s account, admissible as the object of cognition however. The first is inadmissible because nowhere an external object is grasped as a unity, whole, one apart from its parts ([ĀlamPV] Tshad ma ce 86b). The second is inadmissible because when we see things we find that the atoms are not perceived individually as one by one ([Viṃ] 13, Sems tsam shi 3b). The third alternative is also rejected because the atoms in this case cannot be proved to exist as an indivisible ([Viṃ] 14, Sems tsam shi 3b).

Further, if there were a simultaneous conjunction of an atom with other six atoms coming from the six directions, the atom would have six parts because that which is the locus of one atom cannot be the locus of another atom. If the locus of one atom were the locus of the six atoms, which were in conjunction with it, then since all the seven atoms would have the same common locus, the whole mass constituted by the seven atoms would be of the size of a single atom, because of the mutual exclusion of the occupants of a locus. Consequently, there would be no visible mass (Viṃ12, Sems tsam shi 3b).

Since unity is an essential characteristic of being the whole, or composite whereas indivisibility an essential characteristic of being an atom when both the unity and individuality of the atoms are rejected, then the whole and indivisible atoms are no longer admissible. Therefore, Vasubandhu sums up the Yogācāra objections against the reality of the external sense-objects (āyatanas) as: “An external sense-object is unreal because it cannot be the intentional object of cognition either as (1) a single thing or (2) as a multiple in [isolated] atoms; or (3) as a aggregate because the atom is not proven to exist” (Viṃ11, Sems tsam shi 3b).

The realist insists that the external sense objects are real and that their reality is ascertained by the various means of knowledge (pramāṇas) of which perception (pratyakṣa) is the most important. If the external sense objects are nonexistents, there can be no intentional objects, then cognition would not arise. Since cognitions do arise, there must be external objects as their intentional objects.

To this objection, Yogācāra employs two arguments to refute the realist claim and to establish the mechanism of cognition, which takes place without the atoms of an external object. The first argument shows that atoms do not satisfy the criterion of being the intentional object, therefore they do not cause the perception. “Perceptual cognition [takes place] just like in dreams and the like [even without an external object]; moreover, when that [cognition] occurs, the external object is not seen; how can it be thought that this is a case of perception?” (Viṃ16, Sems tsam shi 3b).

The second is the time-lag argument, according to which, there is a time-gap between the perceptual judgement we make and the actual perceptual process. When we make a perceptual judgement, at that time we do not perceive the external object as it is in our mental consciousness (manovijñāna) that carries out the judgement and since the visual consciousness that perceives the object has already ceased. Hence at the time when the mental consciousness delivers it judgment, the perceptual cognition no longer exists since all things are momentary. Therefore the atoms of an external object is not the intentional object of perceptual cognition, since it has already ceased and does not now exist therefore it is not responsible for the cognition’s having the content it has, like the unseen events occurring on the other side of the wall (Vasubandhu’s Viṃśatikā-kārikāvṛtti [ViṃKV] 16–17).

Yogācāra therefore concludes that we cannot postulate the reality of an external object through direct perception. However since in perceptual cognition we are directly aware of something, there must be an intentional object of the perceptual cognition. That intentional object of perceptual cognition is, according to the Yogācāra, none other than the subliminal impressions (vāsanās) passing from their latent state contained in the storehouse consciousness (ālayavijñāna) to their conscious level. Therefore the impressions are the only things that are conventionally real.

Vasubandhu’s [TSN] 35–36 inspired by the Buddhist traditional religious beliefs also offers others arguments to defend the idealism of Yogācāra:

one and the same thing appears differently to beings that are in different states of existence (pretas, men, and gods);
the ability of the bodhisattvas and dhyāyins (practitioners of meditation) who have attained the power of thinking (cetovaśitā) to visualise objects at will;
the capacity of the yogins who have attained serenity of mind (śamatha) and a direct vision of dharmas as they really are (dharma-vipaśyanā) to perceive things at the very moment of the concentration of mind (manasikāra) with their essential characteristics of flux, suffering, nonself, empty; and
the power of those who have attained intuitive knowledge (nirvikalpakajñāna) which enables them not to block the perception of things.

All these arguments based on the facts of experience show that objects do not exist really outside the mind, that they are products of mental creation and that their appearance is entirely mind dependent. Therefore the Yogācāra’s theory of the two truths concludes that the whole world is a product of mind—it is the collective mental actions (karma) of all beings. All living beings see the same world because of the identical maturation of their karmic consequences. Since the karmic histories of beings are same, there is homogeneity in the way in which the world is experienced and perceived. This is the reason there is an orderly world instead of chaotic and arbitrariness. This is also the reason behind the impressions of the objectivity of the world.

4. Madhyamaka

After the Buddha the philosopher who broke new ground on the theory of the two truths in the Madhyamaka system is a South Indian monk, Nāgārjuna (ca. 100 BCE–100 CE). Amongst his seminal philosophical works delineating the theory are Nāgārjuna’s

Fundamental Verses on the Middle Way (Mūlamadhyamakakārikā [MMK],
Seventy Verses on Emptiness (Śunyatāsaptati),
Rebutting the Disputes (Vigrahvyāvartanī^[9] and
Sixty Verses on Logical Reasoning (Yuktiṣaṣṭikā).

Āryadeva’s work Catuḥśatakaṣāstrakārikā (Four Hundred Verses) is also considered as one of the foundational texts delineating Madhyamaka’s theory of the two truths.

Nāgārjuna saw himself as propagating the dharma taught by the Buddha, which he says is precisely based on the theory of the two truths: a truth of mundane conventions and a truth of the ultimate. ([MMK] 24.8, Dbu ma tsa 14b–15a) He saw the theory of the two truths as constituting the Buddha’s core teaching and his philosophy. Nāgārjuna maintains therefore that those who do not understand the distinction between these two truths would fail to understand the Buddha’s teaching ([MMK] 24.9, Dbu ma tsa 15a). This is so, for Nāgārjuna, because (1) without relying on the conventional truth, the meaning of the ultimate cannot be explained, and (2) without understanding the meaning of the ultimate, nirvāṇa is not achieved ([MMK] 24.10, Dbu ma tsa 15a).

Nāgārjuna’s theory of the two truths is fundamentally different from all theories of truth in other Indian philosophies. Hindu philosophers of the Nyāya-Vaiśeṣika, Sāṃkya-Yoga, and Mīmāṁsā-Vedānta—all advocate a foundationalism of some kind according to which ultimate reality is taken to be “substantive reality” (drayva) or foundation upon which stands the entire edifice of the conventional ontological structures where the ultimate reality is posited as immutable, fixed, irreducible and independent of any interpretative conventions. That is so, even though the conventional structure that stands upon it constantly changes and transforms.

As we saw the Buddhist realism of the Vaibhāṣika and the representationalism of the Sautrāntika both advocate ultimate truth as ultimately real, logically irreducible. The idealism of Yogācāra holds nondual mind as the only ultimate reality and the external world as merely conventional truths. On Nāgārjuna’s Madhyamaka all things including ultimate truth are ultimately unreal, empty (śūnya) of any intrinsic nature (svabhāva) including the emptiness (śūnyatā) itself, therefore all are groundless. In this sense a Mādhyamika (a proponent of the Madhyamaka thought) is a an advocate of the emptiness (śūnyavādin), advocate of the intrinsic unreality (niḥsvabhāvavādin), groundlessness, essencelessness, or carelessness. Nevertheless to assert that all things are empty of any intrinsic reality, for Nāgārjuna, is not to undermine the existential status of things as simply nothing. On the contrary, Nāgārjuna argues, to assert that the things are empty of any intrinsic reality is to explain the way things really are as causally conditioned phenomena (pratītyasamputpaṅhā).

Nāgārjuna’s central argument to support his radical non-foundationalist theory of the two truths draws upon an understanding of conventional truth as tied to dependently arisen phenomena, and ultimate truth as tied to emptiness of the intrinsic nature. Since the former and the latter are co-constitutive of each other, in that each entials the other, ultimate reality is tied to being that which is conventionally real. Nāgārjuna advances important arguments justifying the correlation between conventional truth vis-à-vis dependent arising, and emptiness vis-à-vis ultimate truth. These arguments bring home their epistemological and ontological correlations ([MMK] 24.14; Dbu ma tsa 15a). He argues that wherever applies emptiness as the ultimate reality, there applies the causal efficacy of conventional reality and wherever emptiness does not apply as the ultimate reality, there does not apply the causal efficacy of conventional reality (Vig.71) (Dbu ma tsa 29a). According to Nāgārjuna, ultimate reality’s being empty of any intrinsic reality affords conventional reality its causal efficacy since being ultimately empty is identical to being causally produced, conventionally. This must be so since, for Nāgārjuna, “there is no thing that is not dependently arisen; therefore, there is no such thing that is not empty” ([MMK] 24.19, Dbu ma tsa 15a).

Svātantrika / Prāsaṅgika and the two truths

The theory of the two truths in the Madhyamaka in India took a great resurgence from the fifth century onwards soon after Buddhapālita (ca. 470–540) wrote A Commentary on [Nāgārjuna’s] Fundamental Verses of the Middle Way (Buddhapālitamūlamadhyamakavṛtti,^[10]Dbu ma tsa 158b–281a). Set forth in this text is a thoroughgoing non-foundationalist philosophic reasoning and method—prāsaṅga arguments or reductio ad absurdum style without relying upon the svatantra, formal probative argument—to elucidate the Madhyamaka metaphysics and epistemology ingrained in theory of the two truths. For this reason, Buddhapālita is often identified later as the founder of the Prāsaṅgika Madhyamaka, although elucidation of the theory itself is set out in the works of Candrakīrti. Three decades later Bhāvaviveka^[11] (ca. 500–570) challenged Buddhapālita’s interpretation of the two truths, and developed a Madhyamaka account of the two truths that reflects a significant ontological and epistemological shift from Buddhapalitā’s position, which was later defended in the works of Candrakīrti to whom we shall return shortly.

Many later commentators ignore the philosophical contents of the debate between the Prāsaṅgika and the Svātantrika and claim that their controversy is confined only to pedagogical or methodological issues. There is another view according to which the contents of the debate between the Prāsaṅgika and the Svātantrika—Buddhapālita versus Bhāvavevika followed by Bhāvavevika versus Candrakīrti—is essentially philosophic in nature. Underpinning the dialectical or methodological controversy between the two Madhyamaka camps lies a deeper ontological and epistemological divide implied within their theories of the two truths, and this in turn is reflected in the different methodological considerations they each deploy. So on this second view, the variation in the methods used by the two schools of the Madhyamaka are not simple differences in their rhetorical devices or pedagogical tools, they are underlain by more serious philosophical disagreements between the two.

According to this view the philosophical differentiations between the Svātantrika and the Prāsaṅgika is best contained within the discourse of the two truths. Prāsaṅgika’s theory of the two truths we leave aside for the time being. First we shall take up the Svātantrika’s account.

4.1 Svātantrika Madhyamaka

Bhāvaviveka wrote some of the major Madhyamaka treatises including

Lamp of Wisdom (Prajñāpradīpamūlamadhyamakavṛtti [PPMV], Dbu ma tsha 45b–259b),
Verses on the Heart of the Middle Way (Madhyamakahṛdayakārikā [MadhHK],
Blazes of Reasoning: A Commentary on Verses of the Heart of the Middle Way (Tarkajvālā).

In these texts Bhāvavevika rejects the Brahmanical systems of Nyāya-Vaiśeṣika, Sāṃkhya-Yoga, Mīmāṃsā-Vedānta on both metaphysical and epistemological grounds. All the theories of truth and knowledge advanced in these systems from his Madhyamaka point of view are too rigid to be of any significant use. Bhāvavevika’s critiques of Ābhidharmikas—Vaibhāṣika and Sautrāntika—and Yogācāra predominantly target the ontological foundationalism which underpins their theories of the ultimate truth. He rejects them on the ground that from an analytic cognitive perspective, which scrutinises the nature of reality, nothing—subject and object—is found to be ultimately real since all things are rationally reduced to spatial parts or temporal moments. Thus he proposes the view that both the subject and the object are conventionally intrinsically real as both are conventional truths, where as both are ultimately intrinsically unreal as both are empty of ultimate reality, hence emptiness alone is the ultimate reality.

Although Bhāvavevika is said to have founded the Svātantrika Madhyamaka, it is important to note that there exists two different subschools of the Svātantrika tradition:

Sautrāntika Svātantrika Madhyamaka
Yogācāra Svātantrika Madhyamaka

The two schools of the Svātantrika Madhyamaka take Bhāvavevika’s intepretation of the two truths, on the whole, to be more cogent than the Prāsaṅgika’s. Particularly both schools reject ultimate intrinsic reality while positing conventional intrinsic reality. As far as the presentation of ultimate truth is concerned both schools are in agreement—nonself or emptiness alone is the ultimate reality, and the rest—the entire range of dharmas—are ultimately empty of any intrinsic reality. Nevertheless, the two schools differ slightly on the matter related to the theory of conventional truth, specifically concerning reality or unreality of the external or physical objects on the conventional level. The Sautrāntika Svātantrika Madhyamaka view held by Bhāvavevika himself, and his student Jñānagarbha, affirms intrinsic reality of the conventional truths of both the outer domains and the inner domains and mental faculty along with their six respective consciousnesses.

The arguments that affirm the conventional reality of the external objects are the same arguments that Bhāvavevika employed to criticise the Yogācāra arguments rejecting the reality of external objects. Bhāvavevika’s [MadhHK] 5.15 points out Yogācāra’s arguments are contradicted by perception (pratyakṣa), tradition (āgama) and commonse sense (lokaprasiddha), since they all prove the correctness of the cogniton of material form ([MadhHK] 5.15 Dbu ma dza 20b and Tarkajvālā 5.15 Dbu ma dza 204ab). Yogācāra’s dream argument is also rejected because, according to Bhāvavevika, dream-consciousness and so forth have dharmas as their objects (ālambana / dmigs pa) ([MadhHK] 5.19 Dbu ma dza 20b). And dharmas are based on intrinsically real conventional objects, because they are the repeated impression of the objects that have been experienced previously, like memory (Tarkajvālā 5.19 Dbu ma dza 205a).

The Yogācāra Svātantrika Madhyamaka view held by Śāntarakṣita and his student Kamalaśīla affirms conventionally intrinsic reality of the inner domains and rejects the intrinsic reality of the outer domains and it claims the external objects are mere conceptual fictions.

4.1.1 Sautrāntika Svātantrika Madhyamaka

Of the two schools of Svātantraka we shall first take up the theory of the two truths presented in the Sautrāntika Svātantrika Madhyamaka. Bhāvavevika’s position represents the theory of the two truths held by this school which was later promoted by his disciple Jñānagarbha. The cornerstones of the Sautrāntika Svātantrika Madhyamaka theory of the two truths are the following theses:

That at the level of conventional truth all phenomena are intrinsically real (svabhāvataḥ), because they are established as intrinsic realities from the perspective of the non-analytical cognitions of the naïve ordinary beings. Allied to this thesis is Bhāvavevika’s claim that the Madhyamaka accepts, conventionally, the intrinsic reality of things, for it is the intrinsic reality that defines what is to be conventionally real.
That at the level of ultimate truth, all phenomena, with the exception of the emptiness which is ultimately real, are intrinsically unreal (niḥsvabhāvataḥ), or ultimately unreal, because they are established as empty of any intrinsic reality from the perspective of analytical exalted cognition (i.e., ultimate cognition of ārya-beings). Allied to this thesis is Bhāvavevika’s claim that Madhyamaka rejects intrinsic reality at the ultimate level since ultimate reality constitutes that which is intrinsically unreal, therefore empty.

Conventional truth

We shall consider Sautrāntika Svātantrika Madhyamaka’s defence of the two claims in turn. We will begin first with Bhāvavevika’s definition of the conventional truth. In the Tarkajvālā, he defines conventional truths as an “incontrovertible (phyin ci ma log pa) linguistic convention.” (Dbu ma dza 56a) Such conventional truth on Bhāvavevika’s Svātantrika takes two forms—unique particulars (svalakṣaṇa / rang mtshan) and universals (sāmānyalakṣaṇa / spyi mtshan) as the Tarkajvālā III.8, explains:

Phenomena have dual characteristics (lakṣana / mtshan nyid), differentiated as being universal or unique. Unique particular (svalakṣaṇa / rang mtshan) is a thing’s intrinsic reality (svabhāvatā / rang gi ngo bo), the domain of engagement which is definitively ascertained by a non-conceptual cognition (nirvikalpena jñānena / rnam par rtog pa med pa’i shes pa). Universal (sāmāṅyalakṣaṇa) is a cognitive domain to be apprehended by an inferential cognition (anumanavijñānena / rjes su dpog pa’i shes pa) which is conceptual (Dbu ma dza 55b).

In this passage Bhāvavevika essentially summarises some of the key features of conventional truths which are also critical to understanding the differences between the Svātantrika and Prāsaṅgika.

Bhāvavevika accepts, based on this passage, unique particular (svalakṣaṇa) as an integral part of the ontological structure of the conventional truth. The Prāsaṅgika, by contrast, rejects the concept of unique particular even at the level of conventional truth.
Bhāvavevika ascribes unique particular an ontological qualification of being “intrinsically real” (svabhāvatā), or “inherently real” as its given status, explicitly affirming a form of foundationalism of unique particulars at the level of conventional truth, which the Prāsaṅgika totally rejects.
Bhāvavevika endorses the Pramāṇika’s epistemology in which unique particular, which is intrinsically real, conventionally, is considered as the domain of engagement ascertained by a non-conceptual cognition. The universal (sāmāṅyalakṣaṇa) is considered as the domain to be apprehended by a conceptual inferential cognition.

Bhāvavevika’s defence of the thesis that conventionally things are intrinsically real can be summed up in two arguments. First, as far as things are conventional realities they are also intrinsic or inherent realities, for being intrinsically real is the reason why things are designated as “conventional reality,” since from a conventional standpoint—i.e., non-analytical cognitive engagements of the ordinary beings—things do appear to be inherently real. This means that being “intrinsic” is, for Bhāvavevika, what makes conventional reality a reality.

Bhāvavevika’s second argument states that as long as a Mādhyamika accepts conventional reality it must also accept things as intrinsic in order to avoid the nihilism charge, for conventional reality is defined in terms of its being intrinsically and uniquely real (svalakṣaṇa). Denying intrinsic reality of things at the conventional level, would therefore entail the denial of their conventional existence, since it would entail the denial of the defining characteristics of the conventional reality. This follows says Bhāvavevika because “The Lord (bhāgvan / bcom ldan ldas) has taught the two truths. Based on this [explanatory schema] conventionally things are posited in terms of their intrinsic natures and [unique] particulars ([sva]lakṣaṇa / mtshan nyid). It is only ultimately that [things are] posited as having no intrinsic reality” ((Dbu ma dza 60a).

Ultimate truth

Bhāvavevika’s second thesis is that at the level of ultimate truth, all phenomena are intrinsically unreal (niḥsvabhāvataḥ), therefore Madhyamaka rejects intrinsic reality ultimately. Bhāvavevika’s Tarkajvālā 3.26 offers three ways to interpret the compound paramārtha “ultimate domain” or “ultimate object” literally. In the first, both the terms “ultimate” (param) and “domain” (artha) stands for the object—emptiness (śūnyatā)—because it is both the “ultimate” or “final” as well as an “object to be known,” “analysed” (parīkṣaṇīya / brtag par bya ba) and “understood” (pratipādya / go bar bya ba). In the second compound, paramārtha stands for “object of the ultimate” (paramasya artha / dam pa’i don) where “object” refers to emptiness and “ultimate” refers to a non-conceptual exalted cognition (nirvikalpajñāna / rnam par mi rtog pa’i ye shes) of the meditative equipoise (samāhita / mnyam bzhag). In the third compound paramārth stands for a concordant ultimate (rjes su mthun pa’i shes rab), a cognition that accords with the knowledge of the ultimate since it has the ultimate as its domain.

The first two etymological senses of the term paramārthas have in them the sense of emptiness as an objective domain since it is both the final ontic status of things and it is the ultimate object of a non-conceptual exalted cognition. Bhāvavevika’s third etymological sense of the term paramārtha has it identified with cognition that accords with the knowledge of the ultimate truth on the ground that such cognition has emptiness as its object and such knowledge is a means through which one develops a non-conceptual knowledge of ultimate reality. This third sense of paramārtha allows Bhāvavevika to argue that a cognition of the subsequent attainment (pṛṣṭhalabdhajñāna / rjes thob ye shes) which directly follows from the non-conceptual meditative equipoise, while it is conceptual in character, is nevertheless a concordant ultimate ([PPMV] Dbu ma tsa 228a).

So for Bhāvavevika then, “the ultimate is of two kinds: one is transcendent (lokuttara / ‘jig rten las ‘das pa), undefiled (zag pa med pa), free from elaboration (aprapañca / spros med) which needs to be engaged without a deliberative effort. The second one” as he explains in Tarkajvālā 3.26 “is elaborative (prāpañca / spros pa), hence it can be engaged with a deliberative effort by means of a correct mundane cognitive process (dag pa’i ‘jig rten pa’i ye shes) that is sustained by the collective force of virtues (bsod nams) and insights (ye shes)” (Dbu ma dza 60b).

Bhāvavevika advances several arguments to defend the thesis that ultimately all are intrinsically unreal. The first is the conditionality argument pertaining to the four elements, according to which, all the four elements are ultimately empty of any intrinsic reality, for they all are conditioned by the causal factors appropriated for their becoming and their existence.

The second is Bhāvavevika’s non-foundationalist ontological argument which demonstrates all phenomena, including the atoms, are ultimately non-foundational, for ultimately there is nothing that can be taken as the foundational entity (dravya) or intrinsically real since the ultimate analysis reveals that all phenomena are composed of the atomic particles that are themselves composites.

Bhāvavevika’s third non-foundationalist epistemological argument shows that ultimately the objects are not the domain of cognitions. The argument says that “A visible form is not ultimately apprehended by the visual faculty because it is a composite (bsags) like a sound and because it is a product of the elements like the sound.” ([MadhHK] 3.33 Dbu ma dza 5a) The reasons provided to justify the thesis are twofold: (i) being composite and (ii) being a product of the elements. Given that being composites and products equally apply to visible form and sound, these two reasons cannot warrant the validity of the argument justifying the thesis that a visible form is ultimately apprehended by the visual faculty. If they did, they would equally warrant the validity of the argument justifying the thesis that a sound is ultimately apprehended by the visual faculty (Dbu ma dza 65ab).

In conclusion: mirroring these two critically important philosophical positions Bhāvavevika introduces a type of method or pedagogical device that is unique to the Svātantrika contra to his Prāsaṅgika counterpart.

4.1.2 Yogācāra Svātantrika Madhyamaka

In the early eighth century Bhāvavevika and Jñānagarbha’s theory of the two truths was adopted and elucidated in the works of the latter’s student^[12] Śāntarakṣita (705–762) and his student Kamalaśīla (ca. 725–788). Śāntarakṣita wrote:

Verses on the Ornament of the Middle Way (Madhyamakālaṁkārakārikā [MAK], Dbu ma sa 53a–56b),
Commentary on the Verses of the Ornament of the Middle Way (Madhyamakālaṁkāravṛtti, [MAV], Dbu ma sa 56b–84a).

In these works he argues for the synthesis of Madhyamaka and Yogācāra’s theories of the two truths which resulted in the formation of the Yogacārā-Svātantrika Madhyamaka—a subschool within the Svātantrika Madhyamaka. Kamalaśīla, who is a student of Śāntarakṣita, held the same conception of the two truths in his works:

Subcommentary on the Ornament of the Middle Way (Madhyamakālaṁkārapañjikā, Dbu ma sa 84a–133b),
Light of the Middle Way (Madhyamakālokaḥ [MA], Dbu ma sa 133b–244a),
Discussion on the Light of Reality (Tattvāloka-nama-prakaraṇa, Dbu ma sa 244b–273a),
Establishing the Non-intrinsic Reality of All Phenomena (Sarvadharmāsvabhāvasiddhi, Dbu ma sa 273a–291a),
Stages of Meditation (Bhāvanākrama, Dbu ma ki 22a–68b).

Unlike Jñānagarbha and Bhāvavevika’s realistic Sautrāntika Svātantrika Madhyamaka which presents conventional truth in agreement with the epistemological realism of the Sautrāntika and ultimate truth in agreement with non-foundationalist ontology of the Madhyamaka, Śāntarakṣita and Kamalaśīla advocate the Yogācāra Svātantrika Madhyamaka. They each maintain a basic presentation of conventional truth in agreement with the epistemological idealism of Yogācāra and the presentation of ultimate truth in agreement with the ontological non-foundationalism of the Madhyamaka. Therefore Śāntarakṣita concludes: “By relying on the Mind Only (cittamatra / sems tsam) one understands that external phenomena do not exist. And by relying on this [i.e., Madhyamaka] one understands that even [the mind] is thoroughly nonself.” ([MAK] 23 Dbu ma sa 56a) “Therefore, one attains a Mahāyāna [path] when one is able to ride the chariots of the two systems by holding to the reigns of logic.” ([MAK] 24 Dbu ma sa 56a) By “the two systems” Śāntarakṣita meant, Yogācāra’s account of the conventional truth with Madhyamaka’s account of the ultimate truth.^[13]

Underlying this syncretistic view of the two truths lay two fundamental theses that Yogācāra Svātantrika Madhyamaka are committed—namely:

that there is no real external object, mind is the only thing that is conventionally real, hence Yogācāra is right about its presentation of the conventional truth; and
that even mind is unreal and empty of any intrinsic nature under ultimate analysis, therefore nothing is ultimately real, hence Madhyamaka is right about its presentation of the ultimate truth.

And it is precisely the synthesis of these two theses that defines the characteristic of the theory of the two truths in the Yogācāra Svātantrika Madhyamaka. Śāntaraṣita and Kamalaśīla attempt to achieve this distinctive syncretistic characteristic in their works to which we turn our discussion.

Ultimate truth

We will follow Śāntarakṣita and Kamalaśīla and first take up the second major thesis—ultimately everything, including the mind, is unreal and empty. Therefore, ultimate truth is the emptiness of any intrinsic reality. According to Kamalaśīla ultimate truth has three senses: ([MA], Dbu ma sa 233b)

reality, the nature of which is characterised as “nonself of person” and “nonself of phenomena,” is etymologically both ultimate (param / dam pa) and object (artha / don).
transcendent knowledge (lokottaraṁ jñānaṃ), reliable cognition of the ultimate since it is directly engaged with ultimate reality.
mundane knowledge, while not in itself ultimate knowledge, but because it is a complementary means of transcendent knowledge, it is also identified as the ultimate.

Both Śāntarakṣita and Kamalaśīla maintains that the emptiness of intrinsic reality is the ultimate truth, and in order to demonstrate that this is so, Kamalaśīla deploys five forms of arguments—namely:

The diamond-sliver argument (vajrakaṅādiyukti / irdo rje gzegs ma’i gtan tshigs) which shows that all things are empty of intrinsic reality because things are analytically not found to arise—neither from themselves, nor from another nor both nor causelessly ([MA], Dbu ma sa 190a–202b).
The argument refuting the arising of existent and non-existent entities (sadasadutpādapratiṣedhahetu / yod med skye ‘gog gi gtan tshigs) which shows that all things are empty of intrinsic reality because their intrinsic reality is not found to arise either from things that exist or from things that do not exist ([MA], Dbu ma sa 202b).
The arguments refuting the four modes of arising (catuṣkoṭiyutpādapratiṣedhahetu / mu bzhi skye ‘gog gi gtan tshigs) which shows that things are empty of intrinsic reality for the reason that such reality is neither found anaytically in existence (or being) nor in nonexistence (or nonbeing) nor both existence-nonexistence (being-nonbeing) nor neither existence nor nonexistence (neither being nor nonbeing) ([MA], Dbu ma sa 210b).
The neither-one-nor many argument (ekānekaviyogahetu / gcig du bral gyi gtan tshigs) which shows all phenomena are empty of intrinsic reality because they all lack the characteristics of being intrinsically one or intrinsically many ([MA], Dbu ma sa 218b).
The argument from dependent arising (pratītyasamutpādahetu / rten ‘brel gyi gtan tshigs) which shows that things are produced from the association of multiple causes and condition, and therefore showing that things do not have any intrinsic reality of their own ([MA], Dbu ma sa 205b).

The most well-known of Śāntarakśita’s arguments is the neither-one-nor many argument,^[14] which seeks to examine the final (or ultimate) identity (ngo bo la dpyod pa) of all phenomena. In his [MAK] and [MAV] Śāntarakṣita develops this argument in a great detail. The essential feature of the argument is as follows: “The entities that are proclaimed by our own [Buddhist] schools and the other [non-Buddhist] schools, lack intrinsic identity because in reality their identity is neither a (1) singular nor a (2) plural—like a reflection.” ([MAK] 1, Dbu ma sa 53a) In this argument:

The subject (rtsod gzhi cos can): the entities that are proclaimed by our own Buddhist schools and the other non-Buddhist schools (from here on ‘all entities.)
The property to be proved (sādhyadharma / sgrub bya’i chos) : the lack of intrinsic identity.
What is being proved (sādhya / sgrub bya) : all entities lack the intrinsic identity.
The reason (hetu / rtags) or means of proof (sādhana / sgrub byed) : in reality their identity is neither a singular nor a plural.
Example: like a reflection.

According to Śāntarakṣita the validity of the neither-one-nor many argument depends on whether or not it satisfies the triple criteria (trirūpaliṅga / tshul gsum) of formal probative reasoning. The first criterion (pakṣadharmatā / phyogs chos) shows that the reason qualifies the subject (phyogs / pakṣa or chos can / dharmin), i.e., that the subject must be proven to have the property of the reason. That is, all entities must be shown, in reality, as neither singular nor plural. And therefore this argument consists of two premises:

the premise that shows the lack of singularity (“unity”) and
the premise that shows the lack of plurality (or “many-ness”)

In [MAK] and [MAV] Śāntarakṣita develops the argument showing the lack of singularity in two parts: (i) the argument that shows the lack of the non-pervasive singularity in (a) permanent phenomena, and (b) in impermanent entities; and (ii) the argument that shows the lack of pervasive singularity by (a) refuting the indivisible atomic particles which are said to have composed the objects, and (b) by refuting the unified consciousness posited by Yogācāra.

The premise that shows the lack of plurality is based upon the conclusion of the argument that shows the lack of singularity. This is so, argues Śāntarakṣita, because “When we analyse any entity, none is [found] to be a singular. For that for which nothing is singular, there must also be nothing which is plural” ([MAK] 61, Dbu ma sa 55a). This argument of Śāntarakṣita proceeds from understanding that being singular and being plural (manifold) are essentially interdependent—if there are no singular entity, one must accept that there are no plural entity either since the latter is the former assembled.

According to Śāntarakṣita the argument from neither-one-nor many satisfies the triple criteria of valid reasoning. It satisfies the first criterion because all instances of the subject, namely the intrinsic identities of those entities asserted by the Buddhist and non-Buddhist opponents, are instances of entities which are neither singular nor plural. The second criterion of a valid reason—the proof of the forward entailment (anvayavyāpti / rjes khyab), i.e., the proof that the reason occurs in only “similar instances” (sapakṣa / mthun phyogs) where all instances of the reason are the instances of the predicates—is also satisfied because the reason—all phenomena are neither singular nor plural—is an instance of the predicate—phenomena which lack identity. The third criterion of a valid reason—the proof of the counter entailment (vyatirekavyāpti / ldog khyab / ldog khyab), or the proof that the reason is completely absent from the dissimilar instances of the predicate (vipakṣa / mi mthun phyogs)—hold because there are no instances of the predicate which are not instances of the reason.

There are no instances of phenomena, which lacked intrinsic identity, which are not also instances of phenomena, that are neither singular nor plural. Therefore “the counter entailment holds since there are no entities that could be posited as existing in other possible alternatives” ([MAV] 62 Dbu ma sa 69b).

Thus the second and the third criteria which are mutually entailing prove the entailment of the neither one-nor many argument. Once the entailment^[15] of the argument is accomplished, in Śāntarakṣita’s view, all potential loopholes in this argument are addressed. And therefore the argument successfully proves that all phenomena are empty of any intrinsic reality, since they all lack any singular or plural identity.

It is clear, then, that the arguments of Śāntarakṣita and Kamalaśīla have the final thrust of demonstrating the reasons why all phenomena ultimately lack any intrinsic reality, and are therefore geared towards proving the emptiness of intrinsic reality as the ultimate truth, in each argument a specific domain of analysis is used to prove the final ontological position.

Conventional Truth

Let us now turn to the first thesis and look at the Yogācāra-Svātantratika Madhyamaka defence of the theory of conventional truth. As we have seen from the arguments such as neither-one-nor many, Śāntarakṣita and Kamalaśīla draw the conclusion that entities are ultimately empty of reality, for ultimately they do not exist either as a singular or as a plural. They then move on to explain the way things do exist, and Śāntarakṣita does this with an explicit admission that things do exist conventionally—“Therefore these entities are only conventionally defined. If [someone] accepts them as ultimate, what can I do for that?” ([MAK] 63 Dbu ma sa 55a). Why is it that all entities are defined as only conventionally real? To understand the answer to this question, we need to look at Śāntarakṣita’s definition of conventional reality, which consists of three criteria:

it strictly appeals to its face-value and cannot be subjected to reasoned analysis (avicāraṁaṇīya);
it is causally efficient; and
it is subjected to arising and disintegration ([MAK] 64, Dbu ma sa 55a).

Elsewhere in [MAV] Śāntarakṣita also provides a broader definition of conventionality (saṁvṛti / kun rdzob), and argues that conventionality is not simply a linguistic convention (śabda-vyvahāra / sgra’i tha snyad), it also includes what is conventionally real, those that are seen and accepted by the Mādhaymikas as dependently coarisen (pratītyasamutpanna / rten cing ‘brel ‘byung), and those which cannot be rationally analysed ([MAV] 65, Dbu ma sa 70a).

Kamalaśīla’s definition of conventional truth stresses epistemic error (brānta jñāna / rnam shes khrul ba) in as much as he does stress on non-erroneous epistemic perspective (abrānta jñāna / rnam shes ma khrul ba) in his definition of the ultimate truth. So on his definition, the nature of all entities, illusory persons and the like, is classified into two truths by virtue of erroneous (brānta / khrula ba) and non-erroneous cognition through which they are each represented.

Kamalaśīla’s definition of conventional truth makes explicitly clear the synthesis between Madhayamaka and Yogācāra. The Yogācāra Svātantrika Madhyamaka claims that the Yogācāra is right about the presentation of the conventional truth as mere mental impressions, and that this can be seen from the way in which Śāntaraṣita and Kamalaśīla defend this synthesis textually and rationally through relying heavily on the sūtras—Saṃdhinirmocannasūtra, Laṅkāvatārasūtra, Saddharmapuṇḍarīkasūtra and so forth—traditionally supporting Yogācāra idealism. The claim is made here, and Śāntarakṣita does this explicity, that the Madhyamaka and the idealistic doctrines taught in these scriptures are all “consistent.” ([MAV] 91 Dbu ma sa 79a) The works of these two philosophers produce abundant citations from these sūtra literatures stressing the significance of the passages like this from the Laṅkāvatārasūtra: “Material forms do not exist, one’s mind appears to be external.”

In terms of the argument, Śāntarakṣita argues “that which is cause and effect is mere consciousness only. And whatever is causally established abides in consciousness.” ([MAK] 91, Dbu ma sa 56a) Therefore phenomena that appear to be real external objects like a blue-patch are not something that is distinct from the nature of the phenomenological experience of blue-patch, even so, as the material form experienced in dreams is not distinct from the dreaming experience ([MAV] 91 Dbu ma sa 79a).

Briefly, then, it is clear the two Svātantriak schools—Sautrāntika-Svātantrika-Madhyamak and the Yogācāra-Svātantrika Madhyamaka—both uphold the standard Madhyamaka position in terms of treating emptiness as the ultimate truth, although, they vary somewhat in their presentation of conventional truth since the former is realistic and the latter idealistic about the nature of the conventional truth.

4.2 Prāsaṅgika Madhyamaka

Bhāvaviveka’s Svātantrika Madhyamaka theory of the two truths soon came under attack from Candrakīrti (ca. 600–650) who, among other works, wrote the following:

Clear-word Commentary on the Fundamental Verses of the Middle Way (Mūlamadhyamakavṛttiprasannapadā [PP], known simply as Prasannapadā, Dbu ma ‘a 1b–200a),
An Introduction on Madhyamaka (Madhyamakāvatāra [M], Dbu ma ‘a 201b–219a),
Commentary on Introduction on Madhyamaka (Madhyamakāvatārabhāśya [MBh], Dbu ma ‘a 220b–348a),
Commentary on Four Hundred Verses (Catuúṣatakaṭika, Dbu ma ya 30b–239a),
Commentary on Seventy Verses on Emptiness (Śūnayatāsaptativṛtti, Dbu ma tsa 110a–121a),
Commentary on Sixty Verses on Reasoning (Yuktiṣaṣṭhikavṛtii, Dbu ma ya 1b–30b), and
Discussion on the Five Aggregates (Pañcaskandhaprakaraṇa, Dbu ma ya 239b–266b)

In these philosophical works, Candrakīrti rejects the theories of the two truths in both Brahmanical and the Buddhist schools of Vaibhāṣika, Sautrāntika, Yogācāra and Svātantrika Madhyamaka. His chief reason for doing this is his deep mistrust of the varying degrees of metaphysical and epistemological foundationalism that these theories are committed to. For example Candrakīrti rejects Bhāvavevika’s reading of Nāgārjuna’s theory of the two truths and explicitly vindicates Buddhapālita’s Prāsaṅgika approach to understanding Nāgārjuna’s Madhyamaka. He does this by demonstrating the groundlessness of the fallacies Bhāvavevika attributed to Buddhapālita, and thereby rejecting Bhāvavevika’s admission and imposition upon Nāgārjuna’s non-foundationalist ontology of a kind of independent formal svātantra argument, which Candrakīrti saw as one encumbered by foundationalist metaphysics, and is incompatible with Nāgārjuna’s ontology. Instead of relying on the two truths theories of other schools, Candrakīrti proposes a distinctive non-foundationalist theory of the two truths in the Madhyamaka, and he defends it against his foundationalist opponents. This school later came to be known as the Prāsaṅgika Madhyamaka.

At the core of the Prāsaṅgika’s theory of the two truths are these two fundamental theses:

Only what is conventionally non-intrinsic is causally effective, for only those phenomena, the conventional nature of which is non-intrinsically real, are subject to conditioned or dependent arising. Conventional reality (or dependently arisen phenomenon), given it is causally effective, is therefore always intrinsically unreal. Hence that which is conventionally (or dependently) coarisen is always conventionally (or dependently) arisen.
Only what is ultimately non-intrinsic is causally effective, for only those phenomena, the ultimate nature of which is non-intrinsically real, are subject to conditioned arising. Ultimate truth (or emptiness), given it is causally effective, is therefore intrinsically unreal. Hence ultimate truth is ultimately unreal (or emptiness is always empty).

Although these two theses are advanced separately, they are mutually coextensive. There is a compatible relationship between conventional truth and ultimate truth, hence between dependent arising (pratītyasamutpāda / rten ‘brel) and emptiness (śūnyatā / stong pa nyid), and there is no tension between the two. We shall examine the Prāsaṅgika arguments in defence of these theses.

4.2.1 Conventional Truth

Let us turn to the first thesis. Earlier we saw that both the Vaibhāṣika and Sautrāntika argue that only ultimately intrinsic reality (svabhāva) enables things to perform a causal function (arthakriya). The Svātantrika Madhyamaka rejects this, and it instead argues that things are causally efficient because of their conventionally intrinsic reality (svabhāva) or unique particularity (svalakṣaṇa). The Prāsaṅgika Madhyamaka, however, rejects both these positions, and argues only what is conventionally non-intrinsic reality (niḥsvabhāva) is causally effective, for only those phenomena, the conventional nature of which is non-intrinsic, are subject to conditioned or dependent arising. Conventional reality (here treated as dependently arisen phenomenon), given it is causally effective, is therefore always intrinsically unreal, and hence lacks any intrinsic reality even conventionally. Hence that which is conventionally (or dependently) coarisen is always conventionally (or dependently) arisen and strictly does not arise ultimately.

In his etymological analysis of the term “convention” (saṃvṛti / kun rdzob) in [PP] Candrakīrti attributes three senses to the term convention:

confusion (avidyā / mi shes pa) for it obstructs the mundane cognitive processes of the ordinary beings from seeing the reality as it is by way of concealing (saṃvṛti / kun rdzob) its nature;
codependent (paraparasaṃbhavana / phan tshun brtan pa) for it is an interdependent phenomenon; and
Signifier (saṁket / rda) or worldly convention (lokavyavahāra / ‘jig rten tha snyad) in the sense of dependently designated by means of expression and expressed, consciousness and object of consciousness, etc ([PP] 24.8 Dbu ma ‘a 163a).

Candrakīrti’s claims that in the case of mundane cognitive processes of the ordinary beings, the first sense of convention eclipses the force of the second and the third senses. As a result, far from understanding things as dependently arisen (the second sense) and dependently designated (the third sense), ordinary beings reify them to be non-dependently arisen, and non-designated. Due to the force of this cognitive confusion, from the perspective of mundane cognitive processes of the ordinary beings, things appear real, and each phenomenon appears intrinsically real in spite of their non-intrinsic nature. Consequently this confusion, according to Candrakīrti, defines epistemic practices of the ordinary beings. For this reason, the epistemic norms or the standard set by mundane convention of the ordinary beings, is poles apart from the epistemic norms set by mundane convention of the noble beings (āryas / ‘phags pa) whose mundane cognitive processes are not under the sway of afflictive confusion.

In order to illustrate this distinction, in his commentary [MBh] 6.28 Candrakīrti introduces the concept: mere convention (kun rdzob tsam) of the noble beings to contrast with conventionally real or conventional true (kun rdzob bden pa) of the ordinary beings. Ordinary beings erroneously grasp all conditioned phenomena as intrinsically real, therefore things are conventionally real and thus are categories of conventional truth. For noble beings, however, because they no longer reify them as real, things are perceived as having the nature of being created (bcos ma) and unreal (bden pa ma yin pa) like the reflected image ([MBh] 6.28 Dbu ma ‘a 255a).

According to Candrakırti’s definition of the two truths, all things embody dual nature, for each is constituted by its conventional nature and its ultimate nature. Consequently, all entities, according to this definition, satisfy the criterion of the two truths, for the definition of the two truths is one based on the two natures. The two truths are, therefore, not merely one specific nature mirrored in two different perspectives ([MBh] 6.23 Dbu ma ‘a 253a). Conventional nature entails conventional truth and ultimate nature entails ultimate truth, and given each entity is constituted by the two natures, the two truths define what each entity is in its ontological and epistemological terms.

Conventional nature is defined as conventional truth because it is the domain of mundane cognitive process, and is readily accessible for ordinary beings, including mundane cognitive process of noble beings. It is a sort of truth, while unreal and illusory in reality, it is yet erroneously and non-analytically taken for granted by mundane cognitive processes of the ordinary beings. Ultimate nature, on the other hand, is defined as ultimate truth because it is domain of the exalted cognitive process which engages with its object analytically, one that is directly accessible for noble beings (āryas) and only inferentially accessible for ordinary beings. It is this sort of truth, both real and non-illusory, that is correctly and directly found out by exalted cognitive processes of noble beings, and by analytic cognitive processes of ordinary beings.

Mundane cognitive process that is associated with the definition of conventional truth and therefore allied to the perception of unreal entities is of two kinds ([M] 6.24 Dbu ma ‘a 205a):

correct cognitive process, and
fallacious cognitive process.

Correct cognitive process is associated with an acute sense faculty, which is not impaired by any occasional extraneous causes of misperception (see below). Fallacious cognitive process is associated with a defective sense faculty impaired by occasional extraneous causes of misperception. In [PP] Candrakīrti introduces us to a similar epistemic distinction:

mundane convention (lokasaṃvṛti / ‘jig rten gyi kun rdzob) and
non-mundane convention (alokasaṃvṛti /‘jig rten ma yin pa’i kun rdzo).

Candrakīrti’s key argument behind to support the distinction between two mundane epistemic practices—one mundane convention and the other non-mundane convention—is that the former is, for mundane standard, epistemically reliable whereas the latter is epistemically unreliable. Consequently correct cognitive processes of both ordinary and awakened beings satisfy the epistemic standard of mundane convention, being non-deceptive by mundane standard, thus they set the standard of mundane convention; whereas fallacious cognitive processes of defective sense faculties, of both ordinary and awakened beings, do not satisfy the epistemic standard of mundane convention, and therefore, they are deceptive even by mundane standard. They are thus “non-mundane convention” as Candrakīrti characterises them in [PP] 24.8 (Dbu ma ‘a 163ab).

Just as they are two kinds of sensory faculty—nonerroneous and erroneous—their objects are, according to Candrakīrti, of two corresponding kinds:

conventionally real and
conventionally unreal.

First, cognitive processes associated with sense faculties that are unimpaired by extraneous causes of misperception grasp the former objects, and because this kind of object fulfils realistic mundane ontological standard, it is thus real for ordinary beings, (not so for the noble beings the issue to which we turn later). Hence it is only conventionally real.

Second, cognitive processes associated with sense faculties that are impaired by extraneous causes of misperception grasp conventionally unreal objects, and because this kind of object does not meet realistic mundane ontological standard, they are thus conventionally unreal.

Although Candrakīrti recognises that conventional reality satisfies the ontological standard of ordinary beings, he, importantly, argues that it does not satisfy the ontological criterion of the Madhyamaka (here synonymous for noble beings). Just as illusion is partly real although partly unreal, all objects that are considered commonsensically as conventionally real, are unreal. The major difference between the two is that a knowledge of illusion being unreal is available to mundane cognitive processes of ordinary beings where as a knowledge of unreality of conventionally real entities is not available to mundane cognitive processes of ordinary beings.

However, for Candrakīrti illusory objects are conventionally real and causally efficient, and that the conventionally real entities themselves are illusion-like. Candrakīrti develops this argument using the two tier theory of illusion.

The argument from the first tier of the theory of illusion demonstrates a causal efficiency of conventionally illusory objects. This, Candrakīrti does by identifying conventionally illusory entities with the so-called conventionally real entities.
The argument from the second tier of the theory of illusion demonstrates an illusory nature of conventionally real entities. This, Candrakīrti does by means of showing that entities that are conventionally real are conventionally empty of intrinsic reality, and by denying conventional reality the ontological status of the so-called intrinsic reality.

Candrakīrti support his argument from the theory of illusion by means of applying four categories of the conventional entities:

Partly unreal entities—illusory objects (e.g. mirage, reflection, echoe etc.);
Partly real entities—non-illusory objects (e.g. water, face, sound etc.);
Intrinsic reality (e.g. substance, essence, intrinsic nature etc.,) and
Conventionally unreal entities (e.g. the rabbit’s horn, the sky-flower etc). ([MBh] 6.28 Dbu ma ‘a 254b–255a).

Candrakīrti accepts conventional reality of both entities—partly unreal (i) and partly real (ii)—on the ground that they both appear in mundane cognitive processes who are confused about their ultimate ontological status. Candrakīrti rejects conventional reality status of those entities that are supposedly intrinsically real (iii) and conventionally unreal (iv), although for different reasons. Conventional reality of intrinsically real entity is rejected in [MBh] 6.28 on the ground that its existence does not, forever, appear to a mundane cognitive processes.

Candrakīrti argues that there is a critical epistemic differentiation to be made between the two entities—conventionally real and conventionally illusory. Deceptive, unreal, and dependently arisen nature of conventionally real entities is beyond the grasp of mundane cognitive processes. By contrast, deceptive, unreal and dependently arisen nature of conventionally illusory, partly unreal, entities is grasped by mundane cognitive processes. Therefore illusory objects are regarded as deceptive, and unreal by the standard of mundane knowledge, whereas, conventionally real things are regarded as nondeceptive and real by the standard of mundane knowledge.

So the argument from the first tier of the illusory theory shows that mundane cognitive processes of ordinary beings fail to know illusory and unreal nature of conventionally real entities, they instead grasp them to be intrinsically real. The argument from the second tier of the illusory theory offers Candrakīrti’s reason why this is so. Here, he argues, the presence of the underlying confusion operating beneath mundane cognitive processes of the ordinary beings is the force by which ordinary beings intuitively and erroneously reify the nature of conventional entities. Hence they grasp conventional entities as intrinsically real, although they are in actual fact on a closer analysis, only non-intrinsic, unreal or illusory.

Therefore intrinsic reality is not a conventional reality and grasping things to be intrinsically real is only a confused belief, not a knowledge. Hence Candrakīrti clearly excludes it from the ontological categories of conventional reality, for the reason that intrinsic reality is a conceptual fiction fabricated by confused minds of the ordinary beings and that it is a conceptual construct thrust upon non-intrinsic entities ([MBh] 6.28 Dbu ma ‘a 255a). In addition Candrakīrti argues that if things were intrinsically real, even conventionally, as the Svātantrikas take them to be, in Candrakīrti’s view, things would exist by virtue of their intrinsic reality, at least conventionally. If this were the case then intrinsic reality would become the ultimate nature of things. That would be absurd.

For Mādhyamikas, things cannot have more than one final mode of existence—if they exist, they must exist qua only conventionally. Consequently, given the mutually exclusive relation of intrinsic reality and emptiness, if intrinsic reality is granted even a conventional reality status, Candrakīrti contends, one has to reject emptiness as the ultimate reality ([M] 6.34, DBu ma ‘a 205b). But since the Mādhyamika asserts emptiness to be the ultimate reality, and given that emptiness and intrinsic reality are mutually exclusive, Mādhyamika must reject intrinsic reality in all its forms—conventionally as well as ultimately ([MBh] 6.36, 1994: 118).

4.2.2 Ultimate truth

We now turn to Candrakīrti’s second thesis—namely, only what is ultimately non-intrinsic is causally effective, for only those phenomena, an ultimate nature of which is non-intrinsic, are subject to conditioned arising. Ultimate reality (or emptiness), given it is causally effective, is therefore intrinsically unreal. Therefore ultimate reality is ultimately unreal (or put it differently, emptiness is ultimately empty).

Candrakīrti defines ultimate reality as the nature of things found by the perception of reality ([M] 6.23 Dbu ma ‘a 205a). In the commentary Candrakīrti expands this definition. “Ultimate is the object, the nature of which is found by particular exalted cognitive processes (yishes) of those who perceive reality. But it does not exist by virtue of its intrinsic objective reality (svarūpatā / bdag gi ngo bo nyid).” ([MBh] 6.23 Dbu ma ‘a 253a) Of the two natures, the object of the perception of reality is the way things really are, and this is, Candrakīrti explains, what it means to be ultimate reality ([MBh] 6.23 Dbu ma ‘a 253ab).

Candrakīrti’s definition raises a couple of important points here. First, by defining ultimate reality as “the nature of things found by particular exalted cognitive processes (yeshes) of those who perceive reality,” he means ultimate reality is not found by any exalted cognitive processes, it must be found by a particular exalted cognitive processes—analytic—that knows things just as they are. Second, by stating that “it does not exist by virtue of its intrinsic objective reality” (svarūpatā / bdag gi ngo bo nyid), he means ultimate reality is not intrinsically real just as much as conventional reality is not intrinsically real. Third, he says that ultimate reality is the first nature of the two natures of things found by perception of reality. This means ultimate reality is ultimate nature of all conventionally real things. For they all have an ultimate nature representing ultimate status, just as they have conventional nature representing conventional status.

Ultimate truth, according to Candrakīrti, for the purpose of liberating all sentient beings ([M] 6.179 Dbu ma ‘a 213a). ‘a 213a) is differentiated by the Buddha into two aspects:

nonself of person (pudgalanairātmya) and
nonself of phenomena (dharmanairātmya)

As we shall see Candrakīrti’s arguments come from two domains of analysis which he employs to account for his theory of ultimate truth: analysis of personal self (pudgala-ātmya / gang zag gi bdag) and analysis of phenomenal self (dharma-ātmya / chos kyi bdag). The analysis will demonstrate whether or not conventionally real phenomena and persons are more than what they are conventionally. So we shall consider Candrakīrti’s arguments under this rubrics:

The not-self argumnent: unreality of conventionally real person;
The emptiness argument: unreality of conventionally real phenomena;
The emptiness is emptiness argument: unreality of ultimate reality.

Let us begin with the first. The not-self argumnent demonstrates, as we shall see, unreality of conventionally real person. We shall develop this argument of Candrakīrti progressively in three steps:

correlation between personal self and the five aggregates;
arguments against personal self; and
reasons for positing personal self as merely dependently designated.

In order to appreciate Candrakīrti’s not-self argument, or the argument that shows unreality of conventionally real person, we need to understand Candrakīrti’s purpose of refuting personal self. According to Candrakīrti it is important that we look into the question: from where does the assumption of self arise before we go any further. He argues, like all the Buddhist philosophers do, the notion of self or the assumption of self arises in relation to personhood. After all it is a personal identity issue. To analyse the self therefore requires us to look closely among the parts that constitute a person, and given that the conception of self is embedded in personhood which is constituted by the five aggregates, we need to examine its relation to our conception of self.

Suffice it here to highlight the important relation that exists between the aggregates and the notion of self. According to Candrakīrti, the five aggregates are primary categories upon which we will draw to examine the phenomenal structure of sentient beings, because of the following reasons: because (1) it serves as a phenomenological scheme for examining the nature of human experience, (2) the way in which human beings construct conceptions of the self is based upon different existential experiences within the framework of the five aggregates, (3) they are the basis upon which we develop the sense of self through the view that objectifies the five aggregates which are transient and composites (satkāyaḍṛṣṭi / ‘jig tshogs la lta ba), either through an appropriation or falsely identifying the aggregates to be self ([MBh] 6.120, Dbu ma ‘a 292ab), (4) they are the objective domain of the arising of defilements that cause us suffering since the false view objectifying the aggregates (satkāyaḍṛṣṭi / ‘jig tshogs la lta ba) to be real self lead to the arising of all “afflictive defilements”, and finally (5) the five aggregates are the objective domain of the knowledge of unreality of personal self. For the simple reason that confusion and misconceptions of self arise in relation to the aggregates, thus it is within the same framework that the realisation of nonself must emerge.

Therefore, for Candrakīrti, it is clear that within the range of the five aggregates exhaust “all” or “everything” that could be considered as the basis for developing the misconception of a reified self and also the basis for correct knowledge of non-self—i.e., reality of person or self.

Candrakīrti develops his arguments against personal self in a great detail in [M]/[Mbh] chapter six. Suffice it here to consider one such argument called “the argument from the sevenfold analysis of a chariot” (shing rta rnams bdun gyi rigs pa). This argument however is more or less a way of putting all his arguments together. In it, Candrakīrti concludes: “the basis of the conception of self, when analysed, is not plausible to be an entity. It is not plausible to be different from the aggregates, nor identity of the aggregates, nor dependent (skandhadhāra) on the aggregates. The ‘basis’ (skandhadhāra) at issue is a compound that exposes the implausibility of self as both the container (ādhāra / rten) and the contained (adheya / brten pa). The self does not own the aggregates. This is established in codependence on the aggregates” ([M] 6.150, Dbu ma ‘a 221b). Putting this argument analogically, Candrakīrti asserts that the self is, in terms of not being intrinsically real, analogous to a chariot. “We do not accept a chariot to be different from its own parts, nor to be identical [to its parts], nor to be in possession of them, nor is it in the parts, nor are the parts in it, nor is it the mere composite [of its parts], nor is it the shape [or size of the those parts]” ([M] 6.151 Dbu ma ‘a 221b).

So the structure of the nonself “chariot” argument that demonstrates unreality of a conventionally real person can be briefly stated as follows:

P1 Self is not distinct from the aggregates.
P2 Self is not identical to the aggregates.
P3 Self and the aggregates are not codependent upon each other.
P4 Self and the aggregates do not own each other.
P5 Self is not the shape of the aggregates.
P6 Self is not the collection of the aggregates.
P7 There is nothing more to a person than the five aggregates.
C Therefore a real personal self does not exist.

There is no ultimately real self that can be logically proven to exist. If it did exist it has to be found when it is subjected to these sevenfold analyses. But the self is not found either to be different from the aggregates, nor identical to the aggregates, nor to be in possession of them, nor is the self in the aggregates, nor are the aggregates in the self, nor is the self the mere composite of the aggregates; nor is the self the shape or sizes of the aggregates. Since there is no more to a person any more than dependently designated self upon basis of the five aggregates, they exhaust all that there is in a person, Candrakīrti therefore concludes that there is no real self anywhere whatsoever to be found in the five aggregates.

From this argument, Candrakīrti concludes that both ultimately and conventionally, any intrinsic reality of a personal self must remain unproven. Therefore according to any of the sevenfold analysis a personal self is unreal, and empty of any intrinsic reality. What Candrakīrti does not conclude from this argument, though, is the implausibility of a conventionally real self for everyday purpose. As matter of fact, Candrakīrti argues, the argument from the sevenfold analysis reinforces the idea that only conventionally real self makes sense. For such a self constitutes being dependently designated on the aggregates in as much as a chariot is dependently designated on its parts (M / MBh 6.158). Just as the chariot is conveniently designated in dependence on its parts, and it is referred to in the world as “agent,” even so, a conventionally self which is established through dependent designation serves as a conventionally real moral agent. Therefore, although the argument from the sevenfold analyses denies the existence of intrinsically real self or ultimately real self, the argument does not entail a denial of conventionally real self. (M / MBh 6.159).

It turns out therefore that a self is merely a convenient designation, or a meaningful label given to the five aggregates, and taken for granted in the everyday purpose as a agent. And it is this nominal self that serves the purpose of moral agent. This nominal or conventional self is comparable to anything that exists conventionally. Candrakīrti compares it to a chariot.

Second, Candrakīrti’s argument from emptiness demonstrates the unreality of the conventionally real phenomena by means of appealing to causal processes at work in producing these entities. The understanding here is that the way in which things arise and come into existence definitively informs us about how things actually are. This argument is an extension of Nāgārjuna’s famous tetralemma argument which states: “neither from itself nor from another nor from both, nor without cause does anything anywhere, ever arise.” ([MMK] 1.1) Candrakīrti develops this argument in great detail in chapter 6 of [M]/[MBh], we shall only have a quick look at its overall strategy without delving into its details.

If entities are intrinsically real there are only two alternative ways for them to arise: either they arise (a) causally or (b) causelessly. If one holds that intrinsically real things arise causally, then there are only three possible ways for them to arise: either they should arise from (1) themselves, or from (2) another or from (3) both.

P1 If intrinsic entity arise from itself it would absurdly follow that cause and effect would be identical and they would exist simultaneously. In which case, the production of an effect would be pointless for it would be already in existence. It is thus unreasonable to assume that something already arisen might arise all over again. ([M] 6.8) If an entity in existence still requires arising then an infinite regress would follow ([M] 6. 9–13).

P2 If an intrinsically real entity arises from another, anything could arise from anything (like a fire from pitch-darkness), given that cause and effect would be distinct, all causes would be equally ‘another’ ([M] 6. 14–21).

P3 If an intrinsic entity arises from both itself and another then both reductio ad absurdums in P1 and P2 would apply ([M] 6. 98).

P4 If an intrinsic entity arises causelessly, then anything could arise from everything ([M] 6. 99–103).

Thus it is not possible for any intrinsic entity to exist because no such entity could be causally produce either from itself or from another or both or causelessly. It follows therefore that any entity that arises causally is not intrinsically real, hence it is dependently originated entity ([M] 6. 104).

Candrakīrti therefore insists that entities that are intrinsically unreal are not nonexistent unlike intrinsically real entities which are nonexistent analogous to the rabbit’s horn. Even though they are not intrinsically real, hence remain unproduced according to the four analyses, unlike the rabbit’s horn, intrinsically unreal entities are objects of mundane cognitive processes, and they arise codependently ([M] 110–114). Hence, in summarising the argument, Candrakīrti states: “Entities do not arise causelessly, and they do not arise through causes like God, for example. Nor do they arise out of themselves, nor from another, nor from both. They arise codependently.” ([M] 6.114, Dbu ma ‘a 209b) So because entities arise codependently, according to Candrakīrti, reified concepts such as intrinsic entities cannot stand up under logical analysis. The argument from dependent arising therefore eliminates the web of erroneous views presupposing intrinsic reality. If entities are intrinsically real, then their arising could be through themselves, from another or from both, causelessly. However upon critical analysis the entity as such proves to be nonexistent ([M]/[MBh] 6. 115–116).

Third, Candrakīrti’s argument from the emptiness of emptiness demonstrates the unreality of ultimate reality. The “emptiness-argument” and the “nonself-argument” show that all conventionally real phenomena and persons are empty of intrinsic reality. As we have seen from a critical rational point of view, it is demonstrated that there is no ultimately real or ultimately existent entities or real self of person to be found. The two arguments do not however show that emptiness per se is empty, nor do they show that the selflessness is itself selfless. This raises an important question: does this mean that emptiness is the intrinsic reality of conventionally real entities and selflessness is the intrinsic reality of conventionally real persons? Putting the question differently: could a Mādhyamika claim that emptiness and selflessness are ultimately real or are intrinsically real? This question is reasonable. We tend to posit ultimate reality to be something that is timeless, independent, transcendent, nondual etc. So if emptiness is the ultimate reality of all phenomena and if selflessness is the ultimate reality of all persons,could we say that emptiness and selflessness are nonempty, ultimately real or intrinsically real?

In order to answer this question Candrakīrti maintains that the Buddha reclassifies emptiness and nonself under various aspects—“He elaborated sixteen emptinesses and subsequently he condensed these into four explanations which are adopted by the Mahāyāna.” ([M] 6.180 Dbu ma ‘a 213a) We shall consider one example here: Candrakīrti argues “The eye is empty of eye[ness] because that is its reality. The ear, nose, tongue, body and mind are also to be explained in this way.” ([M] 6.181 Dbu ma ‘a 213ab) “Because each of them are non-eternal (ther zugs tu gnas pa ma yin) not subject to disintegration (‘jig pa ma yin pa) and their reality is non-intrinsic [the emptiness of] the eye and the other six faculties is accepted as ‘internal emptiness’ (adhyātmaśūnyatā)”([M] 6.181 Dbu ma ‘a 2213b).

On Candrakīrit’s view just as the chariot, self and other conventionally real phenomena are intrinsically unreal, so too is the emptiness and the nonself. Emptiness is also empty of intrinsic reality. Candrakīrti explains the emptiness of emptiness as:

The emptiness of intrinsic reality of things is itself called by the wise as ‘emptiness,’ and this emptiness also is considered to be empty of any intrinsic reality. ([M] 6.185 Dbu ma ‘a 213b)

The emptiness of that which is called ‘emptiness’ is accepted as ‘the emptiness of emptiness’ (śūnyatāśūnyatā). It is explained in this way for the purpose of controverting objectification of the emptiness as intrinsically real (bhāva). ([M] 6.186 Dbu ma ‘a 213b)

Also consider Candrakīrti’s argument against positing emptiness as ultimately real that he develops in his commentary on [MMK] 13.7. If emptiness is ultimately real, emptiness would not be empty of the intrinsic reality—the essence of conventionally real objects. In that case we will have to grant emptiness as existing independently of conventionally real entities, as their underlying substratum. If this is granted the emptiness of a chariot and the empty entity, the chariot itself, would be quite distinct and unrelated. Moreover if the emptiness of the chariot is nonempty, i.e., if it is ultimately real, whereas the chariot itself is empty i.e., ultimately unreal, then, one has to posit two distinct and contradictory verifiable realities even for one conventionally real chariot. But since there is not even the slightest nonempty phenomenon verified in the chariot—not even the slightest bit of entity withstanding critical analysis—emptiness of the chariot, like the chariot itself, is implausible to be ultimately real. Like the chariot itself, the emptiness of the chariot is also ultimately empty.

Therefore, while emptiness is the ultimate truth of the conventionally real entities, it is not plausible to posit emptiness to be ultimately real. Similarly, while nonself is the ultimate truth of the personal self, nonself is implausible to be ultimately real. Therefore nonself is not considered as the essence of persons or self.

So, to wind up the discussion on the Prāsaṅgika’s theory of the two truths, just as conventional truth is empty of intrinsic reality, hence ultimately unreal, even so, is ultimate truth empty of intrinsic reality, hence ultimately unreal. It is, therefore, demonstrated that nothing is ultimately real for Candrakīrti, hence everything is empty of intrinsic reality. The heart of Candrakīrti’s two truths theory is the argument that only because they are empty of intrinsic reality can conventionally real entities be causally efficient. Only in the context of a categorical rejection of any foundationalism of intrinsic reality—both conventionally and ultimate, Candrakīrti insists, can there be mundane practices rooted in the mutually interdependent character of cognitive processes and objects cognised. For this reason Candrakīrti concludes that whomsoever emptiness makes sense, everything makes sense. For whomsoever emptiness makes no sense, dependent arising would not make sense. Hence nothing would make sense ([PP] 24.14, Dbu ma ‘a 166b).

5. Conclusion

To sum up, though this entry provides just an overview of the theory of the two truths in Indian Buddhism discussed overview, it nevertheless offers us enough reasons to believe that there is no single theory of the two truths in Indian Buddhism. As we have seen there are many such competing theories, some of which are highly complex and sophisticated. The essay clearly shows, however, that except for the Prāsaṅgika’s theory of the two truths, which unconditionally rejects all forms of foundationalism both conventionally and ultimately, all other theories of the two truths, while rejecting some forms of foundationalism, embrace another form of foundationalism. The Sārvastivādin (or Vaibhāṣika) theory rejects the substance-metaphysics of the Brahmanical schools, yet it claims the irreducible spatial units (e.g., atoms of the material category) and irreducible temporal units (e.g., point-instant consciousnesses) of the five basic categories as ultimate truths, which ground conventional truth, which is comprised of only reducible spatial wholes or temporal continua. Based on the same metaphysical assumption and although with modified definitions, the Sautrāntika argues that the unique particulars (svalakṣaṇa) which, they say, are ultimately causally efficient, are ultimately real; whereas the universals (sāmāṅyalakṣaṇa) which are only conceptually constructed, are only conventionally real. Rejecting the Ābhidharmika realism, the Yogācāra proposes a form of idealism in which which it is argued that only mental impressions are conventionally real and nondual perfect nature is the ultimately real. The Svātantrika Madhyamaka, however, rejects both the Ābhidharmika realism and the Yogācāra idealism as philosophically incoherent. It argues that things are only intrinsically real, conventionally, for this ensures their causal efficiency, things do not need to be ultimately intrinsically real. Therefore it proposes the theory which states that conventionally all phenomena are intrinsically real (svabhāvataḥ) whereas ultimately all phenomena are intrinsically unreal (niḥsvabhāvataḥ). Finally, the Prāsaṅgika Madhyamaka rejects all the theories of the two truths including the one advanced by its Madhyamaka counterpart, namely, Svātantrika, on the ground that all the theories are metaphysically too stringent, and they do not provide the ontological malleability necessary for the ontological identity of conventional truth (dependent arising) and ultimate truth (emptiness). It therefore proposes the theory of the two truths in which the notion of intrinsic reality is categorically denied. It argues that only when conventional truth and ultimate truth are both conventionally and ultimately non-intrinsic, can they be causally effective.

Bibliography

List of Abbreviations

[AK]	Abhidharmakośakārikā
[AKB]	Abhidharmakośabhāṣya
[ĀlamPV]	Ālambanaparīkṣāvṛtti
[M]	Madhyamakāvatāra
[MA]	Madhyamakālokaḥ
[MadhHK]	Madhyamakahṛdayakārikā
[MAK]	Madhyamakālaṁkārakārikā
[MAV]	Madhyamakālaṁkāravṛtti
[MBh]	Madhyamakāvatārabhāśya
[MMK]	Mūlamadhyamakārikā
[PP]	Prasannapadā
[PPMV]	Prajñāpradīpamūlamadhyamakavṛtti
[PVK]	Pramāṇavārttikakārikā
[PVT]	Pramāṇavārttikavṛtti
[TriṃB]	Triṃśikābhāṣya
[TSN]	Trisvabhāvanirdeśa
[ViṃKV]	Viṃśatikā-kārikāvṛtti

Primary Literature

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–––, Auto-commentary on the Compendium of Right-cognition (Pramāṇasamuccayavṛtti, Tshad ma ce 14b–85b). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
–––, Compendium of Right-cognition (Pramāṇasamuccaya, Tshad ma ce 1b–13a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
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–––, Reasoning Hammer (Tarkamudgarakārikā / Rtog Gi Tho Ba’i Tshig Le’ur Byas Pa). Translated by Jayānanda and Khu Mdo rde ’bar. Degé Tangyur: Toh. 3869, dbu ma, ya: 374b-375a; Pedurma (118): 1876–1879.
Jñānagarbha (Yeshes snying po), Commentary Onf The Two Truths Distinction (Satyadvayavibhaṅgavṛtti / Bden Pa Gnyis Rnam Par ’byed Pa’i ’Grel Pa). Translated by Śīlendrabodhi and Yeshes sde. Degé Tangyur: Toh. 3882, dbu ma, sa: 3b-15b.
–––, The Two Truths Distinction (Satyadvayavibhaṅgakārikā / Bden pa gnyis rnam par ’byed pa’i tshig le’ur byas). Translated into Tibetan by Śīlendrabodhi and Yeshes sde. Degé Tangyur: Toh. 3881, dbu ma, sa: 1b-3b. The English translation of Jñānagarbha’s text
Malcolm David Eckel,1992. Jñānagarbha’s commentary on the distinction between the two truths: an eighth century handbook of Madhyamaka philosophy. Indian ed. Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass.
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–––, Establishing the Non-intrinsic Reality of All Phenomena (Sarvadharmāsvabhāvasiddhi, Dbu ma sa 273a–291a), Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
–––, [MA], Light of the Middle Way (Madhyamakālokaḥ Dbu ma sa 133b–244a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
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Komito, D.R., 1999, Nāgārjuna’s Seventy Stanzas: A Buddhist Psychology of Emptiness, Ithaca, New York: Snow Lion Publications.
Maitreyanātha, [DharDVK], Verses on the Distinction Between Phenomena and Reality (Dharmadharmatāvibhaṅga-kārikā, Sems tsam phi 50b–53b). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
–––, Separation of the Middle From Extremes (Madhyāntavibhaṅgakārika, Sems tsam phi 50b–53b). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
Nāgārjuna, Commentary on the Verse Rebutting the Disputes (Vigrahavyāvartanīvṛtti, Vig Dbu ma tsa 121a–137a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998. For English translations of this text see:
- Kamaleswar, B., E.H. Johnson, and A. Kunst, 2002, The Dialectical Method of Nāgārjuna: Vigrahavyāvartanī, New Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass Publishers.
- Westerhoff, Jan, 2010, The Dispeller of Disputes: Nāgārjuna’s Vigrahavyāvartanī. New York: Oxford University Press.
–––, [MMK], Fundamental Verses of the Middle Way (Mūlamadhyamakakārikā, Dbu ma tsa 1b–19a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998. For commentaries in English translations, see:
- Siderits, M. and S. Katsura, 2013, Nāgārjuna’s Middle Way: Mūlamadhyamakakārikā, Boston: Wisdom Publications.
- Garfield, J. and N. Geshe Samten, 2006, Ocean of Reasoning: A Great Commentary on Nāgārjuna’s Mūlamadhyamakākarikā, New York: Oxford University Press.
–––, Seventy Verses on Emptiness (Śūnyatāsaptatikārikā. Dbu ma tsa 24a–27a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998. An English translation of the text is included in Lindtner 1997: 94–120. For Geshe Sonam Rinchen’s commentary on this text in English see Komito 1999.
–––, Sixty Verses on Reasoning (Yuktiṣaṣṭhikākārikā, Dbu ma tsa 20b–22b). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998. For Candrakīrti’s commentary translated from the Tibetan with introductory study and annotation by Joseph John Loizzo and the AIBS translation team see Loizzo, Nāgārjuna’s Reason Sixty with Candrakīrti’s Commentary, New York: Columbia University Press. 2007.
–––, Verses Rebutting the Disputes (Vigrahavyāvartanīkārikā, Dbu ma tsa 27a–29a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
Śāntarakṣita, Commentary on the Distinguishing the Two Truths (Satyadvayavibhaṅgapañjikā Dbu ma sa 15b–52b). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
–––, [MAV], Commentary on the Ornament of the Middle Way (Madhyamakālaṁkāravṛtti Dbu ma sa 56b–84a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
–––, [MAK], Ornament of the Middle Way (Madhyamakālaṁkārakārikā Dbu ma sa 53a–56b). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
Sthiramati, [TriṃB], Commentary on the Thirty Verses (Triṃśikābhāṣya, Sems tsam),Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
Vasubandhu, [AKB], Commentary on the Treasury of Knowledge (Abhidharmakośabhāṣya), Mngon pa ku 26b–258a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998. For English translation see:
- Pruden, L.M., 1988–1990, Abhidharmakośabhāṣyam of Vasubandhu, Vols. I–IV, Berkeley, CA: Asian Humanities Press.
–––, Commentary on The Twenty Verses Viṃśakārikāvṛtti, Sems tsam shi 4a–10a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998. An English translations of verses and their commentary are included in Anacker 2005: 157–181:
- Anaker, S., 2005, Seven Works of Vasubandhu: The Buddhist Psychological Doctor, Delhi: Motilal Banarsidass, 2005,
–––, [ViṃKV], Commentary on the Twenty Verses (Viṃśatikā-kārikāvṛtti, 16–17). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998. An English translations of verses and their commentary are included in Anacker 2005: 157–181.
–––, [TSN], The Discernment of the Three Natures (Tri Svabhāva Niṛdeśa). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998. An English translations of this text is included in Anacker 2005: 287–299.
–––, The Thirty Verses (Triṃśikā kārikā Triṃ; Sem tsam shi 1a–3a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998. For an English translations of the verses see Anacker 2005: 181–191.
–––, [AK], Treasury of Knowledge (Abhidharmakośakārikā); Mngon pa ku 1b–25a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.
–––, The Twenty Verses (Viṃśatikākārikā, Viṃ Sems tsam shi 3a–4a). Sde dge edition of the Bstan ‘gyur. Dharmasala: Paljor Press. 1998.

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Changkya Rolpai Droje (Lcang skya rol pa’i rdo rje), 1989, Philosophical Embellishment of the Buddha’s Teachings (Grub mtha’ thub bstan lhun po’i mdzes rgyan), Xiling: Mtsho sngon mi rigs Press.
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The Theory of Two Truths in India

1. Ābhidharmikas / Sarvāstivāda (Vaibhāṣika)

1.1 Conventional truth

1.2 Ultimate truth

2. Sautrāntika

2.1 Ultimate truth

2.2 Conventional truth

3. Yogācāra

3.1 Conventional Truth

3.2 Ultimate truth

4. Madhyamaka

4.1 Svātantrika Madhyamaka

4.1.1 Sautrāntika Svātantrika Madhyamaka

Conventional truth

Ultimate truth

4.1.2 Yogācāra Svātantrika Madhyamaka

Ultimate truth

Conventional Truth

4.2 Prāsaṅgika Madhyamaka

4.2.1 Conventional Truth

4.2.2 Ultimate truth

5. Conclusion

Bibliography

List of Abbreviations

Primary Literature

Secondary Literature

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