Incommensurable Values

First published Mon Jul 23, 2007; substantive revision Thu Jun 26, 2025

Things are sometimes said to be incommensurable. The meaning of the term can take many different interpretations. Central to all interpretations, however, is the difficulty of making comparisons, often raising profound questions about practical reason and rational choice. This entry explores these interpretations, examines common theories on what it means for two things to be incommensurable with respect to value, and considers the implications of value incommensurability

1. Measurement and Comparison

Much of life involves making comparisons as we weigh the merits of the options available to us. These choices can seem trivial, like deciding between cereal or oatmeal for breakfast, or they can be more significant, like choosing whether to study law or philosophy. Often, we can identify the best option for us. But sometimes, making a comparison feels impossible, as neither option seems to be better, worse or equally good as the other. This difficulty of determining how the options relate can be due to the fact that the options are incommensurable.

In this case, it is the options that are incommensurable. The phenomenon can more generally be said to hold between particular bearers of value where “bearer of value” is to be understood broadly and can include things such as objects of potential choice (such as a career) or states of affairs that cannot be chosen (such as a beautiful sunset). Such bearers of value are valuable in virtue of the abstract value or values they instantiate or display.

While it’s clear that value incommensurability can complicate everyday decision-making, it also presents a theoretical challenge for normative theories that assume options and values can be readily compared and ranked. What remains less clear, however, is how we should understand incommensurability. The term has been used to describe different phenomena, each with various explanations. This first section will provide an overview of how “value incommensurability” has been interpreted.

1.1 The Many Meanings of “Incommensurable”

The term “incommensurable” suggests a lack of common measure. In philosophical discussions, it more specifically refers to the absence of either a cardinal scale or an ordinal scale by which we can compare the values of two value bearers. Some authors reserve the term “incommensurable” for comparisons that can be made ordinally, but not cardinally (Stocker 1980, 176; Stocker 1997, 203; Chang 1997, 2). That is, to some, oatmeal may be clearly better than cereal for breakfast, but it is impossible to say how much better.

Others offer a more demanding definition of the term. They do not consider the absence of a cardinal scale sufficient; for incommensurability to hold, even an ordinal comparison or ranking must be impossible (e.g., Raz 1986; Rabinowicz 2021a). On this interpretation, incommensurability refers to the relationship between two items when neither is better than the other, nor are they equally good.

Some prefer a definition of incommensurability in which two value bearers are considered incommensurable if their relationship can only be described in negative terms—that is, no positive value relation holds between them. This definition depends on the notion “positive value relation” which lacks a clear definition but is believed to be intuitively understandable. Traditionally, it is assumed that there are three such relations: betterness, worseness, and equality. If this traditional view is correct, this definition aligns extensionally with the interpretation mentioned above. However, if additional positive value relations are acknowledged, as some argue they should be, the two interpretations diverge. This possibility will be discussed in Section 2. Both definitions, however, explain why it is difficult, and even impossible, to determine whether cereal is better, worse, or equally as good as oatmeal for breakfast, given their incommensurability.

Others have not given an exact definition of the term, but use it as an inclusive umbrella term for comparability problems in general. This inclusive interpretation has the advantage of encompassing a field of diverse philosophical discussions that engage in problems concerning value comparisons. However, this inclusiveness comes at the cost of precision. James Griffin, for example, gives two examples of what he labels incommensurability. One involves what he calls “trumping.” In a conflict between values A and B, A is said to trump B if “any amount of A, no matter how small, is more valuable than any amount of B, no matter how large” (Griffin 1986, 83). A weaker form of value incommensurability involves what Griffin calls “discontinuity.” Two values, A and B, are incommensurable in this sense if “so long as we have enough of B any amount of A outranks any further amount of B; or that enough of A outranks any amount of B” (Griffin 1986, 85). These suggested forms of incommensurability are, however, compatible with A and B being cardinally measurable. For example, in the case of “discontinuity,” if some amount of A is better than any amount of B, this superiority might still be measurable with a precise cardinal value. The fact that additional instances of B do not change the ordinal ranking of A and B does not entail that the evaluative difference between them cannot be expressed cardinally. This, and other forms of incommensurability compatible with cardinal rankings, will not be discussed further in this entry.

To complicate matters further, not only is the notion of value incommensurability used differently by philosophers, but the term value incomparability is also common in the literature, with no clear consensus on its meaning. Some authors use the terms “incommensurability” and “incomparability” interchangeably (e.g., Raz 1986). Others use them to refer to distinct concepts (e.g., Chang 1997).

In this entry, the term “incomparable” will refer to cases where no positive value relation exists between two value bearers (Chang 1997). The term “incommensurable” will refer to the cases where neither value bearer is better than the other nor are they equally as good. As mentioned above, if the standard three value relations fully exhaust the space of possible value relations the two terms will point to the same examples, but, as will be discussed in Section 2, we shall not assume that there are only three positive value relations. If there are additional positive value relations, incomparability is one, but not the only, subset of incommensurability.

Of course, when two value bearers are incommensurable, cardinal comparisons are impossible. Unfortunately, our terminology lacks a distinct term to describe cases where cardinality is absent, but ordinality remains possible. While this is an interesting possibility, it has received less attention than the more radical notion of value incommensurability. For this reason, ordinality without cardinality will not be addressed further in this entry.

Value comparisons are often taken to be a three-place relation: A is compared with B with respect to V. “V” is here some specific consideration for which the items are being compared. One career may be incommensurable to another with respect to the sense of purpose it will bring to your life, yet they may be comparable with respect to financial stability since one is clearly better than the other in this regard. Some argue that without specifying this “covering consideration” the comparative claim makes no sense (Chang 1997; Thomson 1997; Andersson 2016b). Often, however, the covering consideration is not explicitly expressed but implicitly assumed by the context of utterance.

Specifying the covering consideration also allows us to identify “noncomparability”. If the covering consideration isn’t applicable to the items we are comparing, then they are noncomparable. For example, the number four is noncomparable with the color blue with respect to their tastiness. This form of comparative failure is considered to be of no interest from the perspective of practical reasoning and is consequently not given much consideration in the literature.

2. The Possibility of Incommensurability

The philosophical interest on incommensurability is often motivated by its possible significance for rational choice (Broome 1997, 2000; Chang 1997, 2002; Griffin 1986; Raz 1986). Comparing alternatives is central for rational choice, intuitively we want to know what alternative is the best, and thus examples of incommensurability may pose a challenge to rational decision-making. As we will see, many have met this challenge by developing theories of rational choice that allow for incommensurability or reject the possibility of incommensurability. However, let us first consider the arguments in favor of incommensurability.

The possibility of incommensurability is often argued for by introducing examples that seem to point to its possible instantiation. These examples often take a form similar to that of Joseph Raz’s example in which a person faces the choice between two successful careers: one as a lawyer and one as a clarinettist. Neither career seems better than the other, and they also do not appear to be equally good. If they were of equal value, then a slightly improved version of the legal career would be better than the musical career, but this judgment appears incorrect (Raz 1986, 332).

Ruth Chang has called this the “Small Improvement Argument” (Chang 2002, 667). The Small Improvement Argument takes the following general form: If (1) A is neither better nor worse than B (with respect to V), (2) A+ is better than A (with respect to V), (3) A+ is not better than B (with respect to V), then (4) A and B are not better, worse or equally as good (with respect to V), where V represents the relevant set of considerations for purposes of the comparison (Chang 2002, 667–668). By providing examples in which each premise is true we have succeeded in showing that there is incommensurability.

In addition to Raz, Derek Parfit, and Walter Sinnott-Armstrong are among those who have advanced the Small Improvement Argument (Parfit 1984; Sinnott-Armstrong 1985). A similar argument, but for preference relations has, however, a longer history. Leonard J. Savage hints at this possibility already 1954, in 1958 R. Duncan Luce presented a version of the argument that he attributes to Howard Raiffa, and it was also discussed by Ronald de Sousa in 1974 (Savage 1954; Luce 1958; de Sousa 1974).

Some, however, do not accept the Small Improvement Argument; they reject the possibility of incommensurability and argue for complete comparability. For example, it could be that value bearers are, in fact, comparable, but due to epistemic constraints, they appear incommensurable to us (Forrester 2022). With more knowledge about the value bearers, it might be possible to provide both an ordinal and cardinal ranking of them, but for some reason, acquiring all the relevant knowledge may be practically difficult or even impossible. Others argue that the relevant concepts or natural language do not allow for incommensurability (Regan 1997; Dorr, Nebel & Zuehl 2023). One way to argue for this is to claim that it is a logical fact that all comparatives take the form “x is at least as F as y” or “y is at least as F as x”. From considerations such as these, it is established that there cannot be value incommensurability.

Another influential view is that the Small Improvement Argument merely establishes incommensurability and not incomparability; the argument points to the existence of additional value relations beyond “better than”, “worse than”, and “equally as good”. It is argued that incommensurability does not imply incomparability but rather involves a positive value relation. This perspective is preferable from the perspective of rational choice, as it is argued that the existence of a positive value relation between two options allows for a rational decision to be made (more on this in 4.1). This view is often contrasted with a conservative view, which holds that alleged cases of incommensurability can be accounted for within the framework of the three standard value relations if we acknowledge the possibility of vagueness.

The next two sections summarize the two latter views.

2.1 Incommensurability is Vagueness

It is plausible that it can be indeterminate of two items how they relate with respect to their value. That is, there can be value indeterminacy, which is a separate notion from value incommensurability and value incomparability. For example, Raz argued that both incomparability and indeterminacy of value are possible, with the latter resulting from the “general indeterminacy of language” (1986, 324).

In contrast, some philosophers argue that there is no incommensurability and that indeterminacy can account for alleged cases of incommensurability (Griffin 1986, 96; Broome 1997, 2000, 2022; Andersson 2017; Elson 2017; Dos Santos 2019). In essence, it is irrefutable that semantic vagueness exists. For example, consider the predicate “is bald.” This predicate is vague because it has borderline cases: some individuals are clearly bald, others are clearly not bald, and some fall into a borderline category where it is indeterminate whether they are bald. This indeterminacy does not dissolve by making a precise count of the number of hairs on the individuals that fall into the borderline category; the indeterminacy arises from the vagueness of the predicate.

The same applies to value predicates such as “is at least as good as.” For instance, while it may be obvious that A is at least as good as B and that B is at least as good as C, the predicate may exhibit borderline cases. It might be indeterminate whether D is at least as good as B or whether B is at least as good as D. The vagueness of the predicate can thus lead to situations where it is indeterminate which value relation—such as “better than,” “worse than,” or “equally good as”—holds between the items being compared. This indeterminacy, it is argued, can easily be mistaken for incommensurability. Remember, incommensurability arises when it is false that one value bearer is better, worse, or equally as good as another. Indeterminacy, on the other hand, occurs when it is neither true nor false that any of these relations individually obtain. Furthermore, indeterminacy is often considered less worrisome than incommensurability; after all, one of the standard value relations does obtain, but it is indeterminate which one.

Adherents of the view have also argued that the Small Improvement Argument fails to rule out the possibility that it is indeterminate how the value bearers relate; they may be related by one of the standard trichotomous relations, but it could be indeterminate which one (Wasserman 2004; Klockseim 2010; Gustafsson 2013a).

There are also more positive arguments in favor of the vagueness interpretation. The most influential comes from John Broome, who argues that vagueness is incompatible with incommensurability. Therefore, since vagueness cannot be denied, Broome suggests we should reject incommensurability. His argument is somewhat technical and requires a detailed explanation that cannot be fully provided here. But it can be noted that central to his argument is his controversial “collapsing principle” for comparatives (1997, 74). Many counterexamples have been presented to show the implausibility of the principle (Carlson 2004, 2013; Elson 2014b; Gustafsson 2018). While there are attempts to defend the collapsing principle, or versions of it (Constantinescu 2012; Andersson & Herlitz 2018), the counterexamples weaken Broome’s argument. If the principle central to his reasoning is questionable, we should be cautious about accepting his conclusion that incommensurability does not exist.

There are, however, additional arguments supporting the vagueness interpretation. For example, some argue that it is theoretically parsimonious: since it is natural to accept the existence of evaluative vagueness, and if it can easily account for alleged cases of incommensurability, there is no need to accept the more mysterious notion of incommensurability or introduce additional value relations beyond the standard trichotomous ones (Andersson 2017; Elson 2017).

2.2 “Roughly Equal” and “On a Par”

Others have argued that the Small Improvement Argument may support value incommensurability but it need not necessarily support the existence of incomparability. Instead, they propose that some or all cases of incommensurability represent a previously overlooked additional way in which things can be positively related.

Central to their argument is the claim that the Small Improvement Argument implicitly assumes that things can only be positively related in terms of one of the standard trichotomy of comparative relations, “better than,” “worse than,” or “equally good” this is what Chang calls the “Trichotomy Thesis” (2002b, 660). If these three comparative relations do not exhaust the space of comparative relations we cannot arrive at the conclusion that the items under consideration are not positively related; the musical career and the legal career may, in fact, be comparable with respect to a fourth value relation.

The first arguments along these lines were expressed by James Griffin and Derek Parfit who argue that items may in fact be “roughly equal” and hence comparable (Griffin 1986, 80–81, 96–98, and 104; 1997, 38–39; 2000, 285–289; Parfit 1987, 431). As an illustration, Parfit presents an example structurally similar to Raz’s comparison of two careers. In Parfit’s example, the comparison involves two poets and a novelist competing for a literary prize (1987, 431). Neither the First Poet nor the Novelist is worse than the other and the Second Poet is slightly better than the First Poet. If the First Poet and the Novelist were equally good, it would follow that the Second Poet is better than the Novelist. This judgment, according to Parfit, need not follow. Instead, the First Poet and the Novelist may be roughly equal. The intuition is that even though three items display the respects in virtue of which the comparisons are made, some comparisons are inherently rough so that even though two alternatives are not worse than one other, they are not precisely equally good. In turn, the musical and legal careers in Raz’s example may be roughly equal. Parfit later referred to this possibility as there being “evaluative imprecision” allowing for the relation “imprecisely equally as good” (Parfit 2016, 113).

“Roughly equal,” as used here, is to be distinguished from two other ways in which the term has been used: (1) to refer to a small difference in value between two items and (2) to refer to a choice of little significance (Raz 1986, 333). As used here, two items A and B are said to be roughly equal if neither is worse than the other and C’s being better than B does not imply that C is better than A when the comparisons are all in virtue of the same set of respects.

One way to conceive of “roughly equal” is as a “roughed up” version of “equally good.” On this interpretation, the trichotomy thesis holds; there are only three positive value relations, but these can be precise or rough (Chang 2002, 661, fn. 5). This account may appear very similar to the vagueness interpretation; however, it is important to note that Parfit explicitly distinguishes it from semantic vagueness (Parfit 2016). When introducing the notion of “evaluative imprecision,” he explicitly states: “Such imprecision is not the result of vagueness in our concepts, or our lack of knowledge, but is part of what we would know if we knew the full facts” (2016, 113). This might suggest that imprecision is akin to metaphysical vagueness—i.e., vagueness inherent in the fabric of the world rather than our concepts. However, Parfit rejects this interpretation as well. According to him, evaluative imprecision and rough equality should not be equated with vagueness.

A similar but separate and more developed proposal is Ruth Chang’s argument for the concept of “on a par” (Chang 1997; Chang 2002). Two items are said to be on a par if neither is better than the other, their differences preclude their being equally good, and yet they are not incomparable. Imagine comparing Mozart and Michelangelo in terms of creativity. According to Chang, neither Mozart nor Michelangelo is less creative than the other. Because the two artists display creativity in such different fields, however, it would be mistaken to judge them to be equally creative. Nevertheless, according to Chang, they are not incomparable but in fact comparable with respect to creativity. Something positive can be said about their relative merits with respect to the same consideration. According to Chang, they are on a par.

To argue for the comparability of the two artists, Chang presents the “Chaining Argument”. She asks us to imagine a sequence of sculptors who are successively worse than Michelangelo until we arrive at a sculptor who is clearly worse than Mozart in terms of creativity. Chang then brings to bear the intuition that “between two evaluatively very different items, a small unidimensional difference cannot trigger incomparability where before there was comparability” (2002b, 673). In light of this intuition, because Mozart is comparable to this bad sculptor, Mozart is also comparable to each of the sculptors in the sequence, including Michelangelo. (For objections to the argument see Boot 2009; Elson 2014a; Andersson 2016a).

Chang argues that her account differs from Parfit’s, asserting that parity constitutes a distinct fourth value relation rather than a “roughened” version of equality. On her interpretation, rough equality corresponds to betterness or worseness without cardinality. That is, stating that the First Poet is roughly equal to the Novelist is equivalent to asserting that one is better than the other, though it is impossible to specify by how much. On this interpretation of “rough equality,” there is a stark difference between the notions. Unfortunately, the elusiveness of Parfit’s “rough equality” and “imprecise equality” makes it difficult to determinately ascertain how these notions ought to be understood and, consequently, how they differ from Chang’s concept of parity.

Interestingly, some have argued that we can accept parity and accept the trichotomy thesis. For example, Erik Carlson (2010) has argued that parity can be defined in terms of the three standard comparative relations and provides a formal definition of the relation.

Inspired by Joshua Gert (2004), Wlodek Rabinowicz (2008; 2012) has argued that while the trichotomy thesis may be false, the existence of parity does not threaten the traditional trichotomy of preference relations: prefer, equiprefer, and disprefer. He demonstrates this by providing a Fitting Attitudes account of value. The Fitting Attitudes account typically analyzes goodness in terms of a normative component and an attitudinal component. By acknowledging that there can be two levels of normativity— requirement, and permissibility—the account accommodates both parity and standard value relations.

On the account, X is better than Y if and only if it is rationally required to prefer X to Y, and X and Y are on a par if and only if it is rationally permissible to prefer X to Y and also rationally permissible to prefer Y to X. Interestingly, preferences and the lack of preferences, combined with the two levels of normativity, yield 15 possible combinations. This means that the Fitting Attitudes analysis provides conceptual space for 15 possible value relations. Rabinowicz thus provides an account that allows for several value relations beyond parity, betterness, worseness, and equality, making Chang’s claim about a fourth possible value relation seem modest. However, he acknowledges that these are merely logical possibilities and that other factors may limit which of these can be instantiated. While there is room for plenty of relations, he defines imprecise equality in the same way as parity.

Johan Gustafsson (2013b) has, however, questioned Rabinowicz’s approach. He aims to show that the axiological argument for parity can also apply to preference relations. Thus, if Chang’s argument is correct, we should also accept the possibility of a fourth preference relation.

3. Arguments for Value Incommensurability

While recent research has focused on interpreting examples with the structure described by the Small Improvement Argument, earlier research placed less emphasis on the structure of value and instead concentrated on substantive considerations that supported incommensurability, which at the time was understood to imply value incomparability.

The most obvious argument for value incommensurability comes from value pluralism (e.g., Berlin 1969). If one value bearer instantiates one value and another value bearer instantiates a completely different value, then it is possible that these two value bearers are incommensurable with respect to their value. One can of course resist this claim and object that the two value bearers may be comparable despite the fact that they instantiate values that differ greatly in character. Here the notion of “covering consideration” becomes relevant. When comparing value bearers with respect to their overall value, they may seem incommensurable. However, there can be other covering considerations to which they are comparable. To give an example: an act that instantiates equality may seem incommensurable with an act that instantiates liberty when considering their overall value. However, if the focus shifts to the criterion of increasing liberty, the latter act is clearly better.

Pluralism alone does not necessarily entail incommensurability. However, many of the arguments in favor of value incommensurability provide examples of cases where we face choices involving alternatives that instantiate different values, and which we intuitively deem to be incommensurable. Thus, pluralism is often accepted, either implicitly or explicitly.

One need, of course, not refer to a plethora of values in order to argue for the possibility of incommensurability. Two values that are normatively irreducible are sufficient. Consider e.g., the Dualism of Practical Reason as discussed by Henry Sidgwick. Roughly, Sidgwick (1874 p. 507–509) argued that what is morally right can sometimes conflict with what is prudential right. Our duty and our self-interest are derived from different basic principles and are thus normatively irreducible. This results in a dualism of practical reason that can, on some occasions, lead to conflicting requirements. In the same sense, it is possible to argue that there are personal and impersonal values that are normatively irreducible and hence give rise to incommensurability.

We should also note that value monism may be compatible with incommensurability. As Ruth Chang points out, by referring to John Stuart Mill, that value may have both qualitative and quantitative aspects could in principle allow for value bearers to be incomparable due to a difference in their qualitative features. (Chang 1997, 16–17). To this, one can of course question if Mill is to be characterized as a monist.

In this section, some specific, substantial considerations in favor of incommensurability will be discussed.

3.1 Constitutive Incommensurability

It has been argued that value incommensurability is constitutive of certain goods and values and consequently, we should assume its existence.

One version of this argument comes from Joseph Raz. Consider being offered a significant amount of money to leave one’s spouse for a month. The indignation that is typically experienced in response to such an offer, according to Raz, is grounded in part in the symbolic significance of certain actions (1986, 349). In this case, “what has symbolic significance is the very judgment that companionship is incommensurable with money” (1986, 350). Although this form of value incommensurability looks like trumping, Raz does not see this as a case of trumping. He rejects the view that companionship is more valuable than money. If such a view were correct, then those who forgo companionship for money would be acting against reason (1986, 352). Instead, Raz takes the view that a “belief in incommensurability is itself a qualification for having certain relations” (1986, 351). Someone who does not regard companionship and money as incommensurable simply has chosen a kind of life that may be fulfilling in many ways, but being capable of having companionship is not one of them.

In Raz’s account, the symbolic significance of judging money to be incommensurable with companionship involves the existence of a social convention that determines participation in that convention (e.g., marriage) that requires a belief in value incommensurability. This conventional nature of belief in value incommensurability in Raz’s account raises a question for some authors about its robustness as an account of value incommensurability. For example, Chang objects that incommensurability appears to become relative to one’s participation in social conventions (2001, 48). It remains an open question how much of a problem this point raises. Raz’s account appears to illustrate a basic sense in which the values of money and companionship can be incommensurable. Insofar as it is not against reason to choose money over companionship, there is no general way to resolve a conflict of values between money and companionship. In Raz’s account, the resolution depends upon which social convention one has chosen to pursue.

Elizabeth Anderson advances a second argument for constitutive incommensurability. Her account is grounded in a pragmatic account of value. Similar to a Fitting Attitudes account of value Anderson reduces “‘x is good’ roughly to ‘it is rational to value x,’ where to value something is to adopt toward it a favorable attitude susceptible to rational reflection” (1997, 95). She argues that in virtue of these attitudes, there may be no good reason to compare the overall values of two goods. Pragmatism holds that if such a comparison serves no practical function, then the comparative value judgment has no truth value, meaning that the goods are incommensurable (1997, 99). Because the favorable attitudes one adopts toward goods help to make them good, Anderson’s account has been seen as an argument for constitutive incommensurability (Chang 2001, 49). However, it would be more correct to label it constitutive indeterminacy since on her view it is not false that the standard value relations obtain, it is rather neither true nor false that they obtain.

Anderson advances three ways in which there may be no good reason to compare the overall values of goods. First, it may be boring or pointless to engage in comparison. To illustrate, “the project of comprehensively ranking all works of art in terms of their intrinsic aesthetic value is foolish, boring, and stultifying” (1997, 100). Second, Anderson points to instances in which “it makes sense to leave room for the free play of nonrational motivations like whims and moods” as in the choice of what to do on a leisurely Sunday afternoon (1997, 91). Third, Anderson argues that the roles that goods play in deliberation can be so different that “attempts to compare them head to head are incoherent” (1997, 91). Imagine that the only way to save one’s dying mother is to give up a friendship. Rather than compare their overall values, argues Anderson, ordinary moral thinking focuses on what one owes to one’s mother and one’s friends (1997, 102). This focus on obligation recognizes mother and friend each to be intrinsically valuable and yet valuable in different ways (1997, 103). There is no good reason, according to Anderson, to compare their overall values with regard to some common measure.

Chang argues against each of the three points raised by Anderson (Chang 2001). In response to the first point, Chang notes there are occasions in which comparisons do need to be made between goods for which Anderson argues there is no good reason to make comparisons. In response to the second point, Chang argues that the range of instances for which the second argument applies is small. In response to the third point, Chang contends that Anderson’s argument assumes that if goods are comparable then they have some value or evaluative property in common. Chang points out that this need not be the case. As previously mentioned, we cannot assume that two value bearers are incommensurable simply because they instantiate different values.

3.2 Moral Dilemmas

Value incommensurability has been invoked to make sense of a central feature of supposed moral dilemmas—namely, that no matter which alternative the agent chooses, she fails to do something she ought to do. The apparent value conflicts involved in these choices have led some philosophers to relate moral dilemmas to the incommensurability of values. A harrowing example of a moral dilemma is the situation Sophie faces in Sophie’s Choice, where, at a Nazi concentration camp, she is forced by a guard to choose which of her two children will live while the other is condemned to die. If she refuses to decide, both children will be killed. Examples like this may suggest that the incommensurability of her children’s lives is what makes this situation a moral dilemma.

However, this may be a hasty conclusion, as it has been argued that the mere existence of a moral dilemma does not necessarily imply incommensurability. James Griffin, for example, argues that the feature of “irreplaceability” in moral dilemmas often may be mistaken as evidence for incommensurability (1997, 37). Irreplaceability is the feature that what is lost in choosing one alternative over another cannot be replaced by what is gained in choosing another alternative. Choosing two scoops of vanilla ice cream over one scoop of vanilla ice cream should not cause a feeling of irreplaceability, however, choosing two scoops of vanilla ice cream over one scoop of chocolate ice cream may cause a feeling of irreplaceability, even if you clearly prefer vanilla over chocolate. This feeling of irreplaceability or even regret can thus arise in cases of comparability, it may even be rational (see Hurka 1996). If we experience irreplaceability in moral dilemmas, we should not take this as evidence for incommensurability.

Furthermore, some moral dilemmas may involve not a conflict of values, but a conflict of obligations that arises from the same consideration. The dilemma encountering Sophie, it may be said, does not point to the incommensurability of values as the options may be equally bad, but rather a conflict of obligations that are equally strong. Walter Sinnott-Armstrong calls such dilemmas “symmetrical” (1988, 54–58).

Another common approach to argue for value incommensurability is with reference to “non-symmetrical” dilemmas. As the name suggests, in non-symmetrical dilemmas, the alternatives are favored by different values (Sinnott-Armstrong 1988). If these values are incommensurable there is no systematic resolution of the value conflict. Consider Jean-Paul Sartre’s well-known example of his pupil who faced the choice between going to England to join the Free French Forces and staying at home to help his mother live (Sartre 1975, 295–296). Thus, if value pluralism is correct, it allows for the possibility of non-symmetrical dilemmas. If the phenomenology of these dilemmas cannot be explained by irreplaceability, this provides some support for the possibility of incommensurability.

4. Deliberation and Choice

As suggested above much of the inquiry into value incommensurability is motivated more generally by theories of practical reason and rational choice. This section considers these issues as they have been discussed in contemporary philosophical literature.

4.1 Optimization, Maximization, and Comparativism

The connection between value relations and choice is captured by optimization. According to optimization, the fact that an alternative is better or equally as good as the other alternatives is what justifies its choice. Consequently, if two alternatives are incommensurable no justified choice can be made between them. This underscores the normative significance of value incommensurability: if incommensurability is sufficiently pervasive, the scope for justified choice becomes constrained.

However, optimization can be contrasted with “maximization” as a theory of justified choice (Sen 1997, 746; Sen 2000, 486). According to this theory, justified choice only requires the choice of an alternative that is not worse than other alternatives. Because incommensurable alternatives are not worse than one another, the choice of either is justified according to the theory of maximization as justified choice. After all, as Raz argues (1997), if incommensurable options give us reasons to choose both alternatives, then the choice of either alternative is justified on the basis of reason. Thus, if maximization is correct the possibility of incommensurable alternatives is less worrying. However, as we will see in the next subsection, it may have some unwanted consequences.

Ruth Chang has argued for a view somewhat similar to optimization called “comparativism”. According to this view: “comparative facts are what make a choice objectively correct; they are that in virtue of which a choice is objectively rational or what one has most or sufficient normative reason to do. So, whether you are a consequentialist, deontologist, virtue theorist, perfectionist, contractualist, etc., about the grounds of rational choice, you should be, first and foremost, I suggest, a comparativist” (2016, 213). By “comparative fact”, Chang refers to a positive value relation, such as one of the traditional three or an additional relation, like parity. If alternatives are incomparable rather than positively related, the possibility of making an objectively rational choice is ruled out. This perspective thus rejects maximization. While her view is similar to optimization in that both require a positive value relation for a justified choice, optimization restricts justification to the traditional three relations, whereas comparativism allows any positive value relation to justify a choice.

Just as optimization, comparativism also entails that if incomparability is pervasive, the scope for justified choice becomes constrained. Those who find this to be a worrying conclusion can respond that seemingly incomparable alternatives are, in fact, comparable. As discussed in Section 2, judgments of incomparability can be mistaken, and it is possible that, despite appearances, a positive value relation obtains between two seemingly incomparable alternatives. This means that there is a comparative fact that makes a choice objectively correct in cases of apparent incomparability. There remains the issue of determining which alternative we are justified in choosing. This depends on the nature of the apparent incomparability and our preferred theory of justified choice. Some suggestions come naturally: If the alternatives are on a par, we may be justified in choosing either. If it is indeterminate how the alternatives relate, it may likewise be indeterminate which alternative we are justified in choosing. Finally, if we lack sufficient knowledge of the alternatives to determine how they relate, we may also lack sufficient knowledge to make a justified choice.

One can object to optimization and maximization by arguing that, at times, we are justified in choosing what is “good enough”; we can be satisficers. Optimizers and maximizers might argue that we sometimes have instrumental reasons to settle for what is good enough, aiming to achieve an overall maximal or optimal outcome later. Satisficers, however, contend that we can have non-instrumental reasons for choosing what is good enough (Slote 1989; Byron 2004). For example, a person who does not always seek to maximize but instead settles for a moderate amount of a good expresses, according to some, a virtuous trait, and it is clear they are justified in acting in this manner. If this view is correct, we must reject optimization and maximization, and incommensurability may no longer be incompatible with justified choice.

The relation between comparativism and satisficing is less clear. As comparativism is formulated above it does not express which comparative facts that grounds a justified choice. It is thus in theory possible to claim that the fact that an alternative is good enough compared to the alternatives justifies the choice. This does not, however, seem to be what Chang has in mind. To her, it is only justified to choose an alternative that is better than, equally as good, or on a par with the alternatives. For more on this see Stocker (1990; 1997) and Chang (2016, 228).

4.2 Cyclical Choice

One objection voiced against accounts that permit justified choice between alternatives that are roughly equal or on a par or between incomparable alternatives is that such accounts may justify a series of choices that leave a person worse off. Consider Raz’s example of career choice. Suppose a person chooses a musical career over a legal career. At a later time, she has the opportunity to pursue a legal career that is slightly worse than the initial legal career. Suppose this slightly worse legal career and the musical career are judged to be roughly equal, on a par, or incomparable. If justified choice permits her to choose between two alternatives when they are incommensurable, then she would be justified in choosing the slightly worse legal career. Later, she may have the opportunity to pursue a musical career that is slightly worse than her initial musical career. This new musical career may also be roughly equal, on a par, or incomparable with the legal career, justifying her choice of the slightly worse musical career. Through a series of such justified choices, she could end up significantly worse off. To complicate matters further, assume she is now offered the option to pay a small monetary cost to swap from the worse musical career back to the initial musical career. Since the initial musical career is better, it seems justified for her to pay a small amount to obtain it. However, she has now returned to the same choice situation she faced initially, but through a series of justified choices, she has lost money. This appears to be an undesirable feature of a theory of justified choice.

One line of response is that the considerations that make some alternatives worthy of choice count against the constant switching among alternatives envisioned in this objection. First, the constant switching among alternatives is akin to not choosing an alternative. If the alternatives are such that choosing either is better than choosing neither, then the considerations that make the alternatives worthy of choice count against constantly switching among them. Second, switching constantly among careers appears to misunderstand what makes the alternatives worthy of choice. Not only is pursuing a career the kind of activity that depends upon continued engagement for its success, but it is also the kind of activity that is unlikely to be judged truly successful unless one demonstrates some commitment to it. Third, for a career to be considered successful, it may require the chooser to adopt a favorable attitude toward the considerations that favor it over other careers. In turn, when subsequently presented with the choice of a legal career, the considerations favoring it may no longer apply to her in the same way as they did before (Hsieh 2007). When a choice is made, some of our preferences may genuinely shift to align with and deepen our appreciation of the chosen alternative, making it the better option of the two.

John Broome (2000) acknowledges that decision-making can sometimes create value, as described above, but he doubts that this is always the case. Instead, he suggests that choosing a career in law over one in music is also, inherently, a decision to choose a career in law over less favorable options in music. Thus, if you choose a career in law over one in music and are later presented with the opportunity to switch to a less successful career in music, the decision has already been made; you should stick to the career in law. Of course, one is free to change their mind and pursue a career that was previously rejected. Such behavior is not problematic, according to Broome, provided one repudiates their previous choice (2000, 38). While it is true that such a change may leave you worse off than you could have been, as long as you disown your prior choice, your action is not irrational or puzzling according to Broome. By this, he rejects the view that it is inherently irrational to end up worse off than you could have been. The problem, he argues, arises “[i]f at one single time you are willing to endorse both decisions, then you are certainly in a puzzling condition” (2000, 34).

Ruth Chang advances a hybrid view on rational choice to meet the challenge of cyclical choice. She distinguishes “given reasons” from “will-based” reasons. Roughly put, given reasons could here be understood as those that are grounded in normative facts while will-based reasons are “reasons in virtue of some act of the will; they are a matter of our creation. They are voluntarist in their normative source. In short, we create will-based reasons and receive given ones.” (Chang 2013, 177). Will-based reasons come into play when the given reasons no longer can guide our actions. When two alternatives are on a par, given reasons fail to guide us and at this stage, will-based reasons can provide guidance and guarantee that the agent commits to her choice. Once a choice has been made between two alternatives that are on a par, we can commit to one option and thereby will reasons into existence that ensure we will stick to that choice if we face the same decision again.

This latter view captures a general idea that incommensurability provides us with an opportunity to express our will. Instances of incommensurability allow us to not merely act as automatons that merely respond to our given reasons but a possibility to exercise our will (e.g., Raz 1997).

4.3 Risky Actions

Caspar Hare (2010) introduces and discusses a problem relating to how rational choice theory can encompass risky actions involving outcomes that are on a par. If we assume that two outcomes, A and B, are on a par, it follows that a small improvement, or mild sweetening as Hare phrases it, to one of the outcomes would not break the parity relation. We can then imagine two actions, X and Y. If we opt for X then we will either end up with a sweetened A in state 1 or a sweetened B in state 2, and the outcomes are equiprobable. If we opt for Y, we will end up with B in state 1 or A in state 2, and the outcomes are equiprobable.

Now should we do X or Y? On the one hand, it seems as if we ought to opt for X since we are sure that will end up with a sweetened alternative, A+ or B+ which is preferable to merely A or B. On the other hand, it is difficult to say why X is better than Y. The outcome in state 1 is not better if we do X rather than Y since the outcomes, A+ and B, are on a par, and the outcome in state 2 is not better if we do Y rather than X since the outcomes, B+ and A, are on a par.

Hare argues that we should “take the sugar”, i.e., we ought to opt for X. There is, however, an ongoing debate with little consensus on whether there are reasons to take sugar or not (see e.g., Schoenfield 2014; Bales, Cohen & Handfield 2014; Bader 2018; Doody 2019; Rabinowicz 2021b).

5. The Repugnant Conclusion and Spectrum Arguments

We often come across the notion of value incommensurability in the field of population axiology. It was, after all, a puzzle within population axiology that led Parfit to introduce the notion of “rough equality” and later the notion of “imprecision”. He suggested that by acknowledging the possibility of “rough equality” we may be able to escape the so-called Repugnant Conclusion (Parfit 1987, 430) which states that: “For any possible population of at least ten billion people, all with a very high quality of life, there must be some much larger imaginable population whose existence, if other things are equal, would be better even though its members have lives that are barely worth living” (Parfit, 388). The conclusion finds support in what Parfit calls the Continuum Argument (Parfit 2016). We are asked to imagine a spectrum of possible populations, starting with a population consisting of excellent lives. At each step in the spectrum, there is a small drop in the quality of life for each individual, but this is compensated for by a much larger population, making the latter population overall better than the former. As we progress along the spectrum, the quality of life continues to decrease while the population size increases. Eventually, we arrive at a very large population whose members have lives that are barely worth living. By the transitivity of betterness, we can infer that this population is better than the one at the top of the spectrum.

If we assume that the standard three value relations fully exhaust the way populations can relate with respect to value then the transitivity of these relations seems, indeed, to imply the Repugnant Conclusion. However, if we allow for the possibility of e.g., parity, it is possible to claim that some adjacent populations in the spectrum are related by such a relation and thus we have found a way to block the argument. If there are instances of parity along the spectrum the sequence of betterness relations is broken and we can no longer refer to the transitivity of betterness to reach the conclusion (Chang 2016).

We need of course not refer to parity, incomparability, or some other form of incommensurability to argue that there is a break along the sequence of betterness relations. It is also possible to claim that for some adjacent populations in the spectrum, the larger population is worse than the smaller population. This may, however, be more difficult to accept as it clashes with our intuitions concerning the goodness of the populations; it is easier to accept that the larger population is not better than the smaller one than to accept that it is worse.

It should also be noted that the relation invoked must be persistent in the sense that it will obtain between two populations despite quantitative increases to the larger population. That is, if we can point to a break in the spectrum where two populations are related by e.g., parity, the relation must persist despite making the larger population even larger (Handfield & Rabinowicz 2018; Chang 2022). If the relation did not persist there would be a sufficiently large population that was better than its adjacent smaller population and we have failed to block the sequence of betterness relations.

It may seem surprising that parity can be persistent in this sense, as it appears to contradict the intuitions underlying the Chaining Argument. According to this argument, a sufficient number of diminutions can break the parity relation between e.g., two different careers. In cases of persistent parity, however, quantitative improvements cannot break the relation. Chang admits that persistent parity is generally implausible: “it is not the case for any two items on a par that differ by one being a slight diminution in quality and a large enhancement in quantity, that no matter how much we increase the quantity, the items will remain on a par—two careers may be on a par, but if we increase the salary of one of them enough, it can be better” (Chang 2022, 421). However, in a spectrum like the one discussed above, Chang suggests that persistent parity might be plausible.

Invoking non-standard value relations to address the Repugnant Conclusion is not limited to parity. The broader notion of “incommensurability” is often invoked (e.g., Hájek & Rabinowicz (2022)), and Parfit (2016) introduced the concept of “imprecise equality” to address the Repugnant Conclusion. Nor is this approach limited to discussions of the Repugnant Conclusion; similar reasoning applies to other arguments that use a spectrum to reach counterintuitive results.

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Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Acknowledgments

For helpful discussions and comments, Nien-hê Hsieh would like to thank Rahul Kumar, Martin Sandbu, Alan Strudler, Kok-Chor Tan, and Sara Toomey. A special debt of gratitude is given to Walter Sinnott-Armstrong for his support and for his extremely detailed comments and suggestions. Hsieh also would like to thank Jennifer Woo for research assistance.

Copyright © 2025 by
Henrik Andersson <Henrik.Andersson@fil.lu.se>
Nien-hê Hsieh

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