Weighing Reasons

First published Mon Nov 3, 2025

It appears that a lot of things matter for what to do, such as promises, rights, wellbeing, and so on. It also appears that a lot of things matter for what to believe, such as what perceptual experiences you have, what the prior probabilities are, what the experts say, and so on. When something directly matters for what to do or believe, it is often called a reason or a consideration. Sarah can have a reason to visit her mother (she promised to do so) and a reason to stay home (it would be more restful to stay home). These reasons compete insofar as they support incompatible actions. Some reasons matter more than others. Perhaps Sarah is only a little tired and so the promise matters more, i.e., it outweighs the opportunity for greater rest.

An account of weights of reasons is an account of which things directly matter and how much they directly matter. When a factor matters indirectly—e.g., by systematically determining the weights of individual reasons—it matters without itself having weight. To distinguish these indirect factors from reasons, they are often categorized as conditions (enablers, disablers) or modifiers (amplifiers, attenuators). For example, the fact that a promise was coerced may not be a reason to do anything at all and yet it could still matter indirectly by disabling the promise, i.e., by preventing the promise from itself being a reason.

Weighing reasons refers to how the weights of reasons systematically interact to determine some normative status, such as permissible, obligatory, supererogatory, epistemically justified, etc. So understood, it is an open question whether weighing reasons is analogous to weighing physical objects on a balance scale. This entry focuses on the systematic interactions that count as weighing, but it also considers the systematic interactions of indirect factors as well.

Note that material in sections 1, 2.4, 4, 5.3, and 8 may be skipped by first-time readers or those looking for a shorter introduction to the central puzzles and views.

1. Weighing Reasons: What it Is and Isn’t

1.1 Weighing Reasons and Normative Perspectives

If Donna is deliberating about what to choose for her undergrad major, she may weigh the reasons to choose philosophy against the reasons to choose biology. But this entry does not directly concern how agents, such as Donna, should weigh reasons in their deliberations to figure out what to do or believe. Rather, it directly concerns how normative perspectives, such as morality, “weigh” reasons. Less metaphorically, accounts of weighing reasons are theories concerning the structure of a normative perspective (Tucker 2025: §1.2). (See Cullity 2018 for an account of how an agent’s weighing reasons in deliberation might reflect how normative perspectives weigh reasons.)

A normative perspective is a function (i.e., a system with inputs and outputs) that outputs normative verdicts, such as permissible, required, and supererogatory. Examples of normative perspectives include morality, epistemic rationality, prudence, and etiquette. Many structural questions about, say, morality concern how moral reasons are linked to whether an action is morally permissible. How, if at all, does the moral permissibility of going out to dinner tonight depend on the reasons you have to do something else instead? Can it be morally permissible to go out to dinner tonight even if there are weightier moral reasons to instead volunteer at the homeless shelter?

Different normative perspectives might take different things as inputs. Perhaps epistemic rationality’s inputs are just bits of evidence concerning whether some proposition is true whereas morality’s inputs are the costs and benefits of performing some action. Moreover, when different normative perspectives concern the same action or belief, they can provide conflicting guidance. Suppose that you must choose between benefitting yourself or providing a smaller benefit to a stranger. After taking into account all relevant factors as inputs, perhaps prudence outputs that it would be impermissible to provide the smaller benefit to the stranger, whereas morality outputs that you are permitted to do so.

When two normative perspectives, such as morality and prudence, issue conflicting verdicts, you might wonder which verdict is more important. §8 addresses that general issue. But accounts of weighing reasons aren’t primarily concerned with the relative importance of different normative perspectives or how normative perspectives relate to each other. Rather, they are primarily concerned with the internal structure of a normative perspective. For example, they are concerned with distinguishing between different kinds of moral relevance and how the various kinds of morally relevant factors interact to determine what is morally permissible. They aren’t directly concerned with how morality’s requirements relate to those of a different normative perspective, such as practical rationality. To be sure, certain views about the latter issue can constrain morality’s internal structure or which considerations count as morally relevant (see, e.g., Portmore 2008).

To give an account of weighing reasons at all, a philosopher presupposes that the relevant normative system is structured to take multiple, competing considerations as inputs. If some normative perspective violates this presupposition, then the perspective isn’t structured to weigh reasons. For example, Simple Reliabilism holds that a belief is epistemically rational just when it is formed reliably. If this view is true, then epistemic rationality is determined by a single reliability rule rather than the interaction of multiple competing considerations. Simple Reliabilism seems to lack the structure that makes talk of weighing reasons apt (cf. Gert: 2008: 314–316). Most epistemic theories have more complex structure than Simple Reliabilism. For example, more sophisticated reliabilisms appeal to multiple factors—e.g., reliability and absence of counterevidence—but do these factors introduce a competition of competing considerations that would make talk of weighing reasons apt? Hard to say. It is relatively unexplored which epistemic theories, if true, would make talk of weighing reasons apt (Tucker 2025: §1.1).

Most moral theories do presuppose that multiple considerations compete to determine an act’s normative status (standard rule consequentialisms and Kant’s categorical imperative may be exceptions; see Gert 2004: 73–77; Tucker 2025: §1.1.2). For example, a theorist might hold that both consequences and respecting rights matter, such that they can compete to determine whether an act is permissible. If you could save two strangers by killing one innocent person, presumably it would be morally wrong to kill the innocent person. The innocent person’s right to life outweighs the good consequences. But if you could save a billion people by killing one innocent person, then presumably it is morally permissible to kill the innocent person. In this latter case, it seems that the good consequences outweigh the right to life. (See Schroeder 2021b: §3 for a discussion of how weighing reasons is an extension or replacement for Ross’s weighing of prima facie duties; cf. the entry on William David Ross, §4.1.)

The relevant sort of competition is compatible with there being only a single thing that ultimately matters. Consider a crude act utilitarianism: an act is permissible just when it is the option that causes the greatest total amount of pleasure. In some sense, this view says that only a single factor matters, total pleasure. Yet even this single factor view allows different instances of pleasure to compete. Jenny might be forced to choose between Joe’s pleasure and Jack’s pleasure (she can take only one guest to the party), and so these instances of pleasure “compete”. If Jack would enjoy the party more, it makes sense to say that Jenny’s reason to take Jack to the party outweighs her reason to take Joe, and so she ought to take Jack (Gert 2004: 73–77; Berker 2007: 117).

Hawthorne & Magidor (2018) and Titelbaum (2019) reject talk of weighing reasons partly because the “weights” of reasons are too disanalogous with the weights of physical objects, or so they argue (see Tucker 2025, especially chs. 1 and 2 for a reply). This entry is neutral on whether there is a useful analogy between normative and physical weight (force, strength, pressure, etc.). The term ‘weight’ is just a way to talk about how much something directly matters (for a given normative perspective), and the term ‘weighing’ is just a way to talk about how what directly matters interacts to determine normative status (for that normative perspective).

An account of weighing reasons needs to explain how weighing is related to certain interactions that don’t count as weighing, namely the interaction of things that matter indirectly to normative status (e.g., conditions and modifiers—see §5.1). Consequently, an account of weighing reasons is an account of a normative perspective’s structure. That is, it is an account of how what directly and indirectly matters (for that perspective) interacts in a systematic way to determine some normative status, such as permissible, obligatory, supererogatory, etc. (Tucker 2025: §0.2; cf. Horty 2012: 2). This characterization is meant to include theories concerning:

  1. how, if at all, individual reasons are systematically determined by context (e.g., see the debate between atomism and holism in §5.1);
  2. how, if at all, individual reasons for an option systematically combine, or aggregate, to provide the total reason for that option; and
  3. how the total reasons for incompatible options compete to determine whether, e.g., some belief or act is permissible.

§§2–4 focus on C, as C concerns what most directly determines normative status. §§5–6 discuss A and §7 discusses B. The final section concerns how, if at all, accounts of weighing reasons can resolve conflicts between different normative perspectives.

1.2 What are reasons?

For the purposes of this entry, reasons are just the things that have weight—i.e., that play certain direct explanatory roles—in determining normative status. Moral reasons for action have weight concerning what is morally permissible or what you morally ought to do; prudential reasons for action have weight concerning what is prudentially permissible or what you prudentially ought to do; and epistemic reasons for belief have weight concerning what is epistemically permissible or what you epistemically ought to believe. In §5.1 the direct explanatory role associated with weight will be distinguished from the more indirect roles played by conditions and modifiers.

Some theorists hold that some such explanatory role is, most fundamentally, what it is to be a reason (e.g., Broome 2013: 52; Gert 2004: ch. 4; Nebel 2019). Such views are very controversial (see, e.g., Kearns & Star 2008; Brunero 2018). This entry is not intended to adjudicate those debates. Nor is it intended to adjudicate debates about whether justifying an action or a belief is sufficient to be a reason or whether, in addition to justifying, it must also favor or commend that action (cf. §4; Muñoz & Baron-Schmitt 2023: §7–8). If you prefer, you can replace talk of weighing reasons with talk of weighing considerations or weighing pros and cons. While this entry uses ‘reasons’ to refer to all and only those things that directly contribute to normative status, such usage is intended as a convenience.

It is also worth mentioning that talk of weighing reasons is compatible with a range of views concerning how fundamental reasons are within the normative realm. The idea that reasons interact in a systematic way to determine normative status is compatible with Reasons First, the idea that reasons are normatively fundamental (Schroeder 2021a, 2021b; Eva Schmidt 2020). But it is also compatible with most if not all competitors, including views which hold that that value (Maguire 2016) or fittingness (McHugh & Way 2016) are normatively fundamental.

2. Weighing Reasons: Four Issues

When we have a reason, it is a reason for some option. ‘Option’ is just a generic term for something that gets evaluated for normative status (cf. Portmore 2019: 13, 16). Options are alternatives insofar as selecting one option is to reject the others. One alternative might be to go left; another might be to go right.

The lowercase Greek letter ‘φ’ (“phi”) represents an arbitrary option. In this entry’s examples concerning morality, φ ranges over, roughly, the actions that the agent can do in the circumstances. In its examples concerning epistemic rationality, φ ranges over belief, disbelief, and withholding judgment that P. These two kinds of examples hardly exhaust the kinds of things that can be options. In different examples concerning morality, the options might be emotions, desires, or intentions; in different examples concerning epistemic rationality, the options might be credences, or degrees of confidence.

In both ethics and epistemology, agents often have more than two options. When you are considering some theory T, you have three options: believe, disbelieve, or withhold whether T. When it comes to action, you usually have many options. Right now, you probably have the option to keep reading this entry, to call a friend, to jump up and down, to close your eyes and take a nap, and so on.

Any account of weighing reasons must be designed to handle cases with more than two options. Such cases raise at least four questions:

  1. Is weighing reasons for more than two alternatives just a free-for-all in which all reasons for all alternatives compete against each other all at once?
  2. Can something be a reason for φ relative to one alternative but not another?
  3. If something is a reason against φ, is it always a reason for each alternative?
  4. To weigh reasons properly, must all options be considered or are some options privileged or more important to consider than others?

The following four subsections address each question in turn and highlight some ways in which potential answers interact. In effect, this discussion suggests a broad framework for weighing reasons. Subsequent sections will then consider ways to challenge, refine, or expand this framework.

2.1 Monist Pairwise Permissibility

A number of philosophers, including Cohen (2016: 433–438) and Berker (2018: 430–432), argue that epistemic reasons are weighed differently than moral reasons: one or more principles capture how epistemic reasons determine epistemic status, and different principles capture how moral reasons determine moral status. For simplicity, however, this entry will assume that there is a single way to weigh reasons that works for both ethics and epistemology. (For a reply to Berker and Cohen, see Tucker 2024a.)

If there is a single way to weigh reasons, what principle captures how reasons determine normative status? Well, that may depend on the target normative status. In §§2–3, this entry focuses on principles that aim to capture how reasons determine permissibility and requirement. (Epistemologists often use the term ‘epistemically justified’. One usage of this term is akin to epistemically permissible.) §4 focuses on principles that aim to capture supererogation and a certain type of ought.

A standard principle in both ethics and epistemology is:

Monist Pairwise Permissibility: φ is permissible just when, for each alternative, the reasons for φ are not outweighed by the reasons for that alternative.

This view is a monist view insofar as it assumes that the permissibility of an option boils down to a single weight of reasons. The weight of the reasons for φ is compared with the weight of the reasons for each alternative. This monist assumption will be revisited in §3. (In epistemology, see Schroeder 2015: 163; Cohen 2016: 430; Snedegar 2017: ch 6; and Tucker 2024a: §2. In ethics, see Chang 2017: 9–10; Snedegar 2017: 61–62. Horty’s important 2012 default logic approach to weighing reasons is framed very differently, but it may be compatible with Monist Pairwise Permissibility.)

Monist Pairwise Permissibility suggests that weighing reasons takes place, not in a free-for-all, but in a tournament of pairwise competitions (φ vs. the first alternative, φ vs. the second alternative, and so on). Suppose that you are considering whether to believe your mentor’s pet theory T. Monist Pairwise Permissibility tells you that believing T is permissible just when both: the reasons for believing P aren’t outweighed by the reasons for disbelieving T and the reasons for believing T aren’t outweighed by the reasons for withholding whether T. More generally, it says that φ is permissible just when it never loses a competition with any of its alternatives.

While Monist Pairwise Permissibility is most directly a claim about when φ is permissible, it is indirectly a claim about when φ is required. If it is epistemically permissible to believe P and epistemically permissible to disbelieve P, then neither is epistemically required. φ is required just when it is the only permissible alternative. Requirement is unique permissibility. Monist Pairwise Permissibility gives us an account of which options are required when we apply it to φ and each of its alternatives. If it says that φ is permissible and all alternatives are impermissible, then it says that φ is required.

Suppose your current job’s location could be better for your family. You apply elsewhere and, being the superstar that you are, you get two outside job offers, Offer 1 and Offer 2. Pairwise Permissibility says that staying put is permissible just when the reasons to stay put aren’t outweighed by the reasons to take Offer 1 or the reasons to take Offer 2. It says that staying put is required just when it says that staying put is the only permissible option. If the reasons for staying put outweigh the reasons to take Offer 1 and the reasons to take Offer 2, then staying put will be required.

In one respect, Monist Pairwise Permissibility sets a high bar: for φ to be permissible, the reason for φ must not be outweighed by the reason for any alternative. Both ethicists and epistemologists sometimes worry that this bar is too high. In epistemology, Schaffer (2004) and Sinnott-Armstrong (2006) worry that it leads to problematic kinds of skepticism (see the entry on skepticism, especially discussions of “relevant alternatives”).

Returning to ethics, whenever you spend money on yourself, you could have donated that money to prevent the suffering of the world’s poorest. Stephen White (2017b: §5) holds that Monist Pairwise Permissibility, by demanding that you always justify your self-interested purchases over preventing the suffering of the world’s poorest, treats you as responsible for the suffering that you could have prevented. To hold you responsible for such suffering is, he thinks, to demand too much of you.

2.2 Contrastive Reasons

Monist Pairwise Permissibility suggests that reasons function primarily in pairwise competitions. This raises a question. Can a reason’s weight for φ vary as you vary the alternative? For example, can your reason for staying at your current job be weightier when it competes against Offer 1 than when it competes against Offer 2? If the answer to these questions is yes, then there are contrastive reasons. A reason for φ is contrastive just when its weight value (or whether it applies at all) varies as you vary the alternative. Monist Pairwise Permissibility is an equal opportunity employer. It makes room for contrastive reasons, but it doesn’t entail that they exist. Both ethicists and epistemologists sometimes argue that contrastive reasons are needed to explain certain intuitive judgments.

Let’s start with two warm-up cases that involve a single pairwise choice between two options. You promise to meet your friend at the café. As you start walking to the café, you see a child in a burning building. If the only cost of saving the child is that you will break your promise, then you are required to save the child over keeping your promise. That’s because your reason to save the child outweighs your reason to keep your promise. It is controversial whether weight values can be assigned precise numerical values, but for the sake of illustration, suppose that the reason to save the child has 100 units and the promise has only 25 units of weight.

Now suppose that you didn’t make any promises to your friend and that you will be severely burned if you save the child. It seems permissible to remain a bystander over saving the child. Given Monist Pairwise Permissibility, it follows that the reason to remain a bystander is at least as weighty as the reason to save the child.

The first warm-up reveals that your reason to save a life is weightier than your reason to keep the relevant promise. The second warm-up reveals that your reason to avoid severe burns is at least as weighty as your reason to save that life. These reasons interact in a puzzling way when we put them all into a single case with three options.

Consider Kamm’s (1985)

Café or Kid Case. You promised to meet your friend at the café. As you are walking to the café, you see the child in the burning building. You have three options. You can stand around and watch the events unfold (bystander). You can save the child’s life at the cost of severe burns to yourself (save 1). Or you can keep your promise to meet your friend at the café (keep promise).

While it was permissible to choose bystander over save 1 when those were your only two options, it is impermissible to choose it over keep promise. And that’s what’s puzzling. The first warm-up case showed us that the reason for save 1 (100 units) is much weightier than the reason for keeping your promise (25 units). How can the reason for bystander be at least as weighty as the 100 units for save 1 but be less weighty than the 25 units for keeping your promise?

If the reason for bystander has the same weight against both save 1 and keep promise, then paradox looms. But if reasons can be contrastive, the reason for bystander might be weightier against save 1 than against keep promise. And that seems plausible. You have a very weighty reason to choose bystander over save 1 because bystander is your only way to avoid severe burns in that pairwise competition. Assume that your reason to remain a bystander in this pairwise competition has a weight of 500 units. On the other hand, when bystander competes against keep promise, you avoid the severe burns either way. Hence, it seems that you have no reason to choose bystander over keep promise, and so the weight is 0 not 500.

If the reason for bystander is contrastive, then Monist Pairwise Permissibility gives us the intuitive verdict that it is impermissible to choose bystander. In bystander vs. save 1, the reason to choose bystander outweighs the reason to choose save 1 (500 for bystander > 100 for save 1). But, in bystander vs. keep promise, the reason to choose bystander is outweighed by the reason to keep promise (0 for bystander < 25 for keep promise). Hence, Monist Pairwise Permissibility plus contrastive reasons can explain why it is the weaker reason for the promise, rather than the stronger reason for saving the child, that makes it impermissible to remain a bystander. (Given Monist Pairwise Permissibility, these numbers falsely entail that you are required to remain a bystander instead of its being permissible and supererogatory to save 1. §§3–4 consider attempts to resolve this issue.)

This explanation of the Café or Kid Case assumes that the contrastive reason is the reason for bystander. This interpretation can be resisted. What isn’t clear is whether there is a plausible explanation of the intuitive normative verdicts about the Café or Kid case, such that the explanation avoids contrastive reasons altogether. (For discussion of this and related cases in ethics, see Kamm 1985; Muñoz 2021: §§6–7; Tucker 2025: §§5.5, 9.3.1.)

Some philosophers argue that there are also contrastive reasons in epistemology. Intuitively, if your reasons for belief and disbelief are tied or nearly tied, then you are epistemically required to withhold. For example, if your only relevant evidence is that one expert testifies that P and another equally reliable expert testifies that not-P (~P), then you would be required to withhold judgment about whether P is true. Snedegar (2017: ch. 6), Tucker (2024a: §§4–5), and Vollmer (2024: §4) argue that the best explanation of such facts appeals to contrastive reasons in epistemology. For alternative explanations, see Schroeder 2021a: §6.5; Brunero forthcoming.

2.3 Reasons for vs. Reasons Against

So far this entry has focused on weighing reasons for an action. But that you would be severely burned if you save 1 seems to be a reason against save 1 in the Café or Kid Case. What is the relation between reasons for and reasons against? For example, if R is a reason against φ, does it follow that it is a reason for every alternative? Different authors don’t always use the term ‘reason against’ in the same way. Greenspan (2005) uses ‘reason against’ to capture what others try to capture by talk of ‘requiring weight’ (as discussed in §3 below). Further, the best account of the reason for/against distinction may depend on your explanatory ambitions.

Snedegar (2018) aims to make sense of how English speakers use the term ‘reason’ in everyday discourse. He argues that, in such discourse, reasons have contrasts, so that to be a reason for φ is to be a reason for φ rather than some specified alternatives. He argues, further, that reasons often have more than one contrast. Cheaptastic has the lowest prices, so its low prices are a reason for it rather than the relatively expensive Mediumella and very expensive Gourmeteriffic. The relatively high prices of Mediumella are a reason against it. While its relatively high prices are a reason for Cheaptastic, they are not a reason for choosing Gourmeterrific, as the latter has even higher prices. In this case, Mediumella’s relatively high prices seem to be a reason against it that is a reason for some alternatives but not others (cf. Wedgwood 2022: §2; Thomas Schmidt 2024).

But what if the thing to explain is, not the linguistic usage of the word ‘reason’, but how reasons interact to determine deontic status? Here Snedegar agrees with Monist Pairwise Permissibility that reasons function primarily in pairwise competitions (Snedegar 2017: 60–62). It is only reasons with a single contrast—that is, a reason for φ rather than a specific alternative to φ—that directly contribute to whether an option is permissible or required. If Snedegar is correct, then reasons with no contrast or more than one contrast can be ignored for the purposes of determining which options are permissible and required. (In the language to be introduced in §5, Snedegar apparently holds that basic or fundamental reasons always have a single contrast. Cf. Tucker 2025: §§5.3–4.)

When focused on reasons with a single contrast—i.e., when focused on how reasons function in pairwise competitions—what is the relation between reasons for and against? Tucker (2022b: 90–91; 2025: 5.1.2) argues that the relation should be understood on analogy with relation of taller and shorter. There is just one relation of relative height between Joe and Jack. One might refer to that relation by saying “Joe is taller than Jack” or by saying “Jack is shorter than Joe”. Whether one uses the former or the latter generally depends on what one wants to emphasize in a given conversation.

Consider again the choice between bystander and save 1 from §2.2. Are the burns you get from running into the burning building a reason for bystander or a reason against save 1? The choice can seem arbitrary. That’s because the burns bear just one reason relation to these two alternatives. The burns push bystander toward permissibility and push save 1 away from being required. If one wants to focus on why save 1 isn’t required, then one can point out that the burns are a reason against save 1. If one wants to focus on why bystander is permissible, one can point out that the burns are a reason for bystander. But the reason for bystander and against save 1 are identical: in each pairwise competition, every reason is a reason for one option against the alternative (cf. Snedegar 2013: 240 n. 22).

A word of caution. Whether this is the correct account of the distinction between reasons for and against may depend on how the issues in the next subsection are sorted.

2.4. Option Individuation and Weighing Reasons

Weighing reasons implies a competition between the reasons for each option. This subsection considers how the competitors in this competition, the options, are themselves determined. Drew takes a drink on a specific occasion, thereby choosing one of his options. But that action can be truly described in different ways at varying levels of specificity. All of the following could be true descriptions of what Drew did: he drank something; he drank something even though he wasn’t thirsty; he drank water on a Tuesday in July; he drank someone else’s water without permission when they were literally dying of thirst and he wasn’t thirsty. To individuate options is to divide up (potential) true descriptions of what the agent could do in the situation into a list of options.

Some theorists argue that, to weigh reasons properly, options must be individuated in a specific way, the privileged way. A prominent account of the privileged way goes as follows. First, options must be individuated so that reasons compete. Your reasons to drink something and your reasons to drink water often don’t compete because you can do both at the same time. To guarantee competition, options must be mutually exclusive, i.e., to choose one option is to reject all the others. Individuated in this way, all options are alternatives to each other.

Second, options must be individuated so that all the competitors are identified. Whether some option is permissible depends on what else the agent could do in the circumstances (Portmore 2019: 8–11; Snedegar 2015: 379). Whether it is morally permissible to kill Steve depends on whether killing him is your only way to prevent him from killing your family. To ensure that all potential agential responses are considered, options must be individuated so that they are exhaustive. For morality, a list of options is exhaustive when every morally assessable act in the circumstances is entailed by one or more options on the list. When weighing reasons, then, options should be individuated so that they are mutually exclusive and exhaustive in the senses explained above (cf. Smith 2020: 116).

A famous case suggests further restrictions on the privileged way to individuate options (the original version is from Goldman [Smith] 1978: 185–186). Professor Procrastinate is invited to do a book review. He is one of the few scholars qualified to do a review on this topic, he has the time, he has performed very little service work over the course of his career, and he previously promised the editor to complete the next review invitation that he was qualified to do. These factors suggest that he is morally required to accept and complete the review, i.e., it would be permissible to accept and complete and impermissible to not do so. But, if he accepts the invitation, then he predictably will procrastinate and never complete the review. This predictable procrastination suggests that it is impermissible to accept the invitation. This case is puzzling. How can it be permissible to accept and complete the review when it impermissible to accept the review at all?

Part of the Professor Procrastinate puzzle is due to the way it considers options at different degrees of specificity. accept and complete is a more specific option than accept, because only the former specifies whether the review is completed. This difference may affect how their normative status is determined.

A maximal option is an option that specifies every feature of the response the agent can control or, at least, specifies it so precisely that any further specification would make no difference to the response’s normative status (cf. Brown 2018: 761–764). For simplicity, suppose that Professor Procrastinate’s maximal options specify only two issues, whether the invitation is accepted and whether the review is completed. accept and complete would be a maximal option and accept wouldn’t be (because it doesn’t specify whether the review is completed). Further, assuming that there’s no way to complete the review for this journal without accepting the invitation, Procrastinate has exactly three maximal options that are mutually exclusive and exhaustive: (i) accept and complete; (ii) accept and don’t complete; and (iii) decline (don’t accept and don’t complete).

Maximalism is the conjunction of two claims. First, the normative status of maximal options is directly determined by the reasons for those maximal options. Second, the normative status of non-maximal(ly specific) options is derived from the normative status of maximal options: a non-maximal option is permissible just when it is entailed by a permissible maximal option. These two claims capture the idea that weighing reasons is, most fundamentally, weighing reasons for maximal options (Brown 2018: 754; Portmore 2019: chs. 4–6; Tucker 2025: §5.4; cf. Smith 2020: §§5–6).

If we combine the first part of maximalism with Monist Pairwise Permissibility, then the maximally specific option accept and complete is permissible just when both:

  • the reasons for accept and complete are not outweighed by the reasons for accept and don’t complete, and
  • the reasons for accept and complete are not outweighed by the reasons for decline.

Now consider whether the non-maximal option accept is permissible. According to the second part of maximalism, whether it is permissible is determined indirectly by the reasons for the maximal options. If accept is permissible, it is because it is entailed by a maximal option accept and complete that is itself permissible. Maximalism entails, then, that reasons for non-maximal options, such as accept, can be ignored when determining normative status. At most, the reasons for non-maximal accept play a derivative role in determining that option’s normative status.

Maximalism is not a substantive view about what moral reasons there are, so it does not settle whether it is permissible for Procrastinate to accept and complete. Yet a complete solution to such puzzles may require maximalism. For discussion, see Portmore (2019: 156–161) and the entry on actualism and possibilism in ethics, §6.

The previous subsection discussed the idea that each reason against φ is identical to a reason for some specified alternative. This relation of identity presupposes that all alternatives are individuated in the privileged way. If some version of maximalism is true, then this identity thesis presupposes that the alternatives are all maximal. This identity thesis doesn’t concern how a reason against φ is related to reasons for non-maximal alternatives. But it can be supplemented with a principle concerning how reasons against maximal options transmit to (derivative) reasons for non-maximal options. For accounts of the reasons for/reasons against distinction that don’t presume maximalism and also concern options at differing degrees of specificity, see Thomas Schmidt 2024 and the debate between Benjamin Kiesewetter (2015, 2018) and Stephen White (2017a).

3. Weighing Reasons to Explain Moral Options

3.1 The Stability and Ubiquity of Moral Options

A case with moral options is a case in which more than one alternative is morally permissible. Intuitively, one such case is the choice between bystander (stand around and watch the events unfold) and save 1 (save a child at the cost of severe burns). This optionality or latitude is often hard to explain. Monist Pairwise Permissibility claims that φ is permissible just when the reasons for it aren’t outweighed by the reasons for any alternative. Consequently, it claims that both bystander and save 1 are permissible just when the reasons for neither option outweighs the other. Trichotomy (about weight) holds that there are exactly three weight comparatives: weightier than, less weighty than, and equally weighty as. Given Trichotomy and Monist Pairwise Permissibility, bystander and save 1 are moral options only if the reasons for the options are exactly tied (equally weighty).

Monist Pairwise Permissibility is a monist view insofar as it assumes that reasons each have only a single weight value, the weight of a reason. Hence, call the conjunction of Monist Pairwise Permissibility and Trichotomy Simple Weight Monism. This simple view of moral options seems inadequate. It cannot explain either the stability or the ubiquity of moral options.

Moral options are often stable in the following sense: a case begins with moral options, you increase or “sweeten” the reasons on only one side (or decrease them), and the moral options remain (Tucker 2023a; cf. Chang 2017). Consider again bystander and save 1. Replace save 1 with save 1+: the child in the burning building is holding a small dog, such that saving the child will also save the small dog. Your reasons to choose save 1+ are weightier than your reasons to choose save 1; however, you still aren’t required to choose save 1+ over bystander. The problem for Simple Weight Monism is that ties in weight quantities are very fragile: any change to one side breaks the tie. If two reasons are tied at 5 units and one is increased to 5.001, the tie is broken. If ties were the only explanation of moral options, then moral options would never be stable.

Moral options are ubiquitous or prevalent, i.e., agents frequently have moral options (Raz 1999: 100; Portmore 2019: 9). Right now, it would be permissible to keep reading this entry; stop reading and donate to an effective charity; do the dishes; get some exercise; and so on. It seems unlikely that the reasons for each of these options is exactly tied. If ties were the only way to explain moral options, then moral options would occur much less frequently than they actually do.

The simple view (the conjunction of Monist Pairwise Permissibility and Trichotomy) is too simple to explain the stability and ubiquity of moral options. Ethicists must pay the price of complication. On the other hand, Simple Weight Monism is more plausible in epistemology. A case with epistemic options, is a case in which more than one doxastic alternative is permissible (for a single subject at a single time). For example, if my total body of evidence makes it permissible to believe P and permissible to instead withhold whether P, then I have epistemic options. Simple Weight Monism can’t explain the stability or ubiquity of epistemic options any more than it can explain the stability and ubiquity of moral options; however, it is much more controversial that epistemic options exist than it is that moral options exist.

In epistemology, it is common to endorse Epistemic Uniqueness: for any given total body of evidence E concerning whether P is true, there is at most one permissible doxastic attitude to take toward P (Roger White 2005; Greco & Hedden 2016). For example, if your evidence makes it permissible to believe that the café’s dessert of the day is apple pie, Epistemic Uniqueness says that it is impermissible to disbelieve or withhold concerning that claim. More generally, if Epistemic Uniqueness is true, then epistemic options are impossible and thus pose no threat to Simple Weight Monism.

Epistemic Permissivism is the denial of Epistemic Uniqueness, but the most popular versions of Epistemic Permissivism also deny that epistemic options exist (Podgorski 2016). They allow that different people can share the same body of evidence and permissibly have different doxastic attitudes (e.g., Schoenfield 2014a, Meacham 2013). Yet to establish the existence of epistemic options, an epistemic permissivism must entail that, for a single person, a single time, and a single total body of evidence, the subject can permissibly take different doxastic attitudes in response to that evidence (for defenses of epistemic options see Jackson forthcoming and Li 2018, 2019).

3.2 Incommensurability and Parity

Simple Weight Monism has two components: Trichotomy and Monist Pairwise Permissibility. This gives us two compatible strategies for explaining the stability and ubiquity of moral options: replace Trichotomy and replace Monist Pairwise Permissibility. Ruth Chang rejects Trichotomy in favor of Tetrachotomy: the only weight comparatives are weightier than, less weighty than, equally weighty as, and on a par with. Two reasons are incommensurable when they can’t be precisely compared (Chang 1997: 1–2; 2017: 6–7). When options are incommensurable, they might be comparable if they can be imprecisely compared. Equality is a precise comparison. Parity is like an imprecise kind of equality. A key difference is that, while small improvements necessarily break ties, they don’t normally break parities (Chang 2002, 2017; cf. Rabinowicz 2008, 2012). If a given philosophy career is on a par with a given law career, then they generally remain on a par if you add an extra $100 per year to the philosophy career. More generally, two options might be on a par when neither option is better than the other, and they can’t be compared precisely enough to be exactly equal.

Call the conjunction of Tetrachotomy and Monist Pairwise Permissibility, Parity Weight Monism. Chang (2017) and Cullity (2018) endorse something like this position, and perhaps also Raz (1999) and Rabinowicz (2008, 2012). An advantage is that it can explain the stability and ubiquity of moral options.

Suppose that beating up Jerry is your only way to save five lives. This gives you two options: respect Jerry’s right not to be beaten up (respect) or beat up Jerry to save five lives (save 5). Monist Pairwise Permissibility holds that respect and save 5 are morally permissible options as long as neither reason outweighs the other. Given Trichotomy, the only way neither could outweigh the other is if the reasons were equally weighty. Tetrachotomy adds a second way that neither reason outweighs the other: they are on a par. Parity Weight Monism holds, then, that respect and save 5 are moral options if the reasons are either tied or on a par. Arguably, the reasons for respect and save 5 are on a par.

Since small improvements don’t normally break parities—since parities are themselves stable—Parity Weight Monism can explain the stability of the moral options in respect vs. save 5. Suppose that beating up Jerry will now save six lives (save 6). If you are forced to choose between respect and save 6, the reasons for the two options still seem to be on a par. Consequently, the choice still involves moral options and stability is explained. The more stable parities are, the more likely that any two randomly selected reasons will be on a par. Hence, the stability of parity plausibly explains the ubiquity of moral options.

Some philosophers object to Parity Weight Monism by attacking parity itself. Dorr, Nebel, & Zeuhl (2023) reject Tetrachotomy and parity, partly on the basis of linguistic considerations (see Carlson and Risberg 2024 for a reply). Schoenfield (2014b) complains that parity conflicts with standard decision theory. Other philosophers object that, even if parity does exist, it cannot explain common kinds of moral options.

Permissible partiality toward yourself, your projects, or your loved ones involves choosing a permissible option that is worse than some other alternative. Perhaps permissible partiality can be required when it is due, e.g., to special relationships. Maybe you are sometimes required to benefit your own child even though you could provide even greater benefits to other children instead (cf. §5.1). Our focus, though, is on morally optional, not required, permissible partiality.

Consider again bystander and save 1. The severe burns you would get saving the child make it permissible to choose bystander; however, it would be even better to choose save 1. If save 1 is better than bystander, then presumably you have weightier reason to choose it. But now Parity Weight Monism’s commitment to Monist Pairwise Permissibility kicks in and we are stuck with this counterintuitive result: it is impermissible to choose bystander, because the reason for it is outweighed by the reason for save 1.

Supererogation involves choosing an option that is morally permissible and morally better than some morally permissible alternative. Morally optional permissible partiality and supererogation are often two sides of the same choice. If you choose bystander, you are permissibly partial toward yourself over the stranger. If you choose save 1, you go beyond the call of duty in a morally good way and do something supererogatory. If morally optional permissible partiality and/or supererogation exist, then Monist Pairwise Permissibility and Parity Monism must be rejected (Tucker 2023a: §1.3; cf. Hurka and Shubert 2012: 1; Muñoz 2021: 713 n. 12). One response to this objection is to bite the bullet and hold that bystander is morally impermissible but then to find some other sense of ‘permissible’ to capture intuitions about permissible partiality and supererogation (Dorsey 2016: ch. 4).

3.3 Weight Pluralism

Monist Pairwise Permissibility assumes that each reason has just a single weight value. Weight Pluralism denies this assumption. It claims that reasons have more than one weight value that aren’t always equal. Following Josh Gert (2003, 2004, 2007a), a standard kind of pluralism holds that reasons have at least two weight values, justifying and requiring weight. A reason’s justifying weight is how good it is at making an option permissible. A reason’s requiring weight is how good it is at making a permissible option required. Since a permissible option is required when the alternatives are impermissible, requiring weight is, in effect, how good a reason is at making the alternatives impermissible.

Some charities are very effective at doing good with relatively small amounts of money. You could spend some money to go out to eat or you could donate that money to feed five hungry children for a single meal. Intuitively, it is often morally permissible to eat out for the self-interested reason that you enjoy it. Your self-interested reason is good at making eating out permissible and thus has substantial justifying weight. On the other hand, self-interested reasons aren’t very good at making permissible actions required. You are hardly required to eat out when you could otherwise feed five children. Nor would you be required to eat out even if you could otherwise feed only a single hungry child. Since self-interested reasons are better at making acts permissible than making permissible acts required, they have more justifying than requiring weight (Tucker 2025: §1.3).

The above characterizations of justifying and requiring weight suggest that justifying weight for φ and requiring weight for an alternative compete. The justifying weight for φ pushes φ toward permissibility. The harder it pushes, the better it is at making φ permissible. The requiring weight for ~φ pushes φ toward impermissibility. The harder it pushes, the better it is at making φ impermissible. Perhaps it is this competition that determines whether φ is permissible:

Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility: φ is permissible just when the justifying weight for φ is not outweighed by the requiring weight for any alternative.

(See Muñoz 2021; Tucker 2023a: §6; 2025: §7.6.)

Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility determines requirement in basically the same way that its Monist counterpart does: if you apply the principle to φ and each of its alternatives, it says that φ is required just when it says that φ is permissible and each alternative is impermissible.

Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility can account for the stability and ubiquity of moral options when reasons have more justifying than requiring weight. The more that a reason’s justifying weight outstrips its requiring weight, the more stable and ubiquitous the moral options it creates (Tucker 2025: §7.3). The stability of moral options was already illustrated in the simple eating-out example above. You began with moral options to eat out or donate to feed five. The moral options remain after reducing the altruistic reason to feeding one. Since self-interested reasons are so much better at making acts permissible than required, they tend to generate stable moral options to do the self-interested option over altruistic alternatives. Choices between self-interest and altruism are ubiquitous, so moral options are likely ubiquitous.

Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility can also explain morally optional permissible partiality. Recall bystander vs. save 1. bystander is worse than save 1, but it is still permissible. For the sake of illustration, suppose that the self-interested reason avoiding severe burns has a justifying weight of 500 and a requiring weight of 5, and the altruistic reason to save the child has 100 units of both justifying and requiring weight. Given these numbers, save 1 is permissible because 100 justifying weight for save 1 outweighs 5 requiring weight for bystander. Yet bystander is also permissible because 500 justifying weight for bystander outweighs 100 requiring weight for save 1. Since the worse option is permissible, the existence of morally optional permissible partiality has been vindicated.

The main argument for Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility is that it is the only account of weighing reasons known to explain morally optional permissible partiality, as well as the stability and ubiquity of moral options more generally. Proponents also allege that it helps explains supererogation (Massoud 2016; Muñoz 2021); the relation between moral and rational requirements (Portmore 2008); prohibition dilemmas (Tucker 2022a: §7.2; 2024b: 25–26; 2025: §4.2.2–3); and a variety of other puzzles concerning apparent intransitivities and/or small improvements (Archer 2016; Muñoz 2021; Tucker 2023a; 2025: chs. 6–7).

Tenenbaum objects to the idea that a reason can have more justifying than requiring weight (2007: 162–174). He worries that such reasons would allow agents to switch between options in a problematically arbitrary way (see Gert 2007b and Tucker 2017: 1375 n. 16 for replies; see Roger White 2005 for a similar objection to epistemic permissivism). Bedke (2011: §1.2) and Snedegar (2016: §7.7) don’t object to the idea that reasons can have more justifying than requiring weight, but they do worry that these weight values can’t provide a good account of ought. This leads us to our next topic.

4. Weighing Reasons for Ought and Supererogation

This entry has thus far focused on weighing reasons for permissibility and statuses that boil down to permissibility, such as moral options (more than one permissible alternative) and requirements (only one permissible alternative). Yet some normative statuses imply comparative evaluations that go beyond permissibility. Supererogation and some accounts of ought assume that two alternatives can have the same moral deontic status (both be morally permissible) and yet one alternative is morally better than the other. How do we weigh reasons to determine such comparative evaluations?

There is arguably a sense of ‘ought’ that treats oughts as requirements (Broome 2013: §§2.4, 7.5; Thomas Schmidt 2024: 250). Weighing reasons for that sort of ought is nothing more than weighing reasons for requirements (aka: obligations), which was covered in §§2–3. Yet a distinct sense of ‘ought’ treats ought as the best thing to do (for a given normative perspective). You morally ought to φ just when it is your morally best permissible option (Snedegar 2016; Portmore 2019; Mullins 2021). In this sense, sometimes the best thing—what you ought to do—goes beyond what you are required to do. Perhaps you ought to send your mother some flowers for her birthday even though you are required only to send her a card (Portmore 2019: 11–12). Additional machinery is needed to weigh reasons for this latter sense of ‘ought’.

The latter sense of ‘ought’ is sometimes characterized by saying that you ought to do what you have most reason to do, where it is assumed that what you have most reason to do will be the best thing to do (Portmore 2019: ch. 1; cf. Snedegar 2016: 155–162). The phrase “most reason to do” suggests that reasons provide only a single ranking that matters for what’s morally better, e.g., that reasons have only a single weight value (the weight of reasons) or that only one weight value matters for what’s morally better (e.g., the requiring weight of reasons). Since these assumptions are actively debated in the literature, this entry sticks to the more generic ought as the best thing to do characterization rather than the ought as what you have most reason to do characterization (cf. Gert 2007a: 549–550; Tucker 2025: §8.1.2).

An action is morally supererogatory only when it is a morally permissible option that is morally better than some morally permissible alternative (Archer 2016; Portmore 2019; Muñoz 2021; for an alternative conception of supererogation, see Dorsey 2016: ch. 4). Paradigmatic examples involve heroic sacrifice for the sake of others, such as choosing save 1 (save a child, getting severely burned in the process) over bystander (stand around and do nothing). If save 1 is the morally best thing you can do in the circumstances, then it might be both supererogatory and what you ought to do. This characterization of supererogation provides only a necessary condition because it is controversial which further conditions need to be met for an act to be supererogatory. One issue is whether the supererogatory act must involve some sort of cost to the agent (Benn 2018).

For the relevant senses of ‘ought’ and ‘supererogation’, there are two things that need explanation: how the target cases can have moral options (how both options can be permissible) and how one option can be better than another when they are both permissible. In passing, it is worth noting that these senses of ‘ought’ and ‘supererogation’ are not common in epistemology, precisely because epistemologists rarely endorse the existence of epistemic options (§3.1 above; see Li 2018 for an exception and Hedberg 2014 for an alternative sense of ‘epistemic supererogation’).

With the exception of Bedke 2011 (see Snedegar 2016: §7.6 for discussion of Bedke’s view), proponents of Weight Pluralism have taken the lead in trying to explain ought and supererogation. They explain moral options as described in §3, by endorsing Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility and the idea that some reasons have more justifying than requiring weight. As Bedke (2011: §1.2) and Snedegar (2016: §7.7) have stressed, this machinery fails as an explanation of which options are morally better than others when they have the same deontic status. Moral justifying and requiring weight are defined in terms of their systematic roles in making actions morally permissible and/or required. They are not defined in terms of whether they make one morally permissible action morally better than another.

This conceptual point hasn’t deterred Weight Pluralists. Some Weight Pluralists point out that justifying and requiring weight may very well play some roles that go beyond the ones they play by definition. For example, Muñoz defends:

Simple Betterness: φ is better than some alternative just when there is more requiring weight for φ than the alternative.

(See Muñoz 2021, especially 702, 712–713 nn. 1 and 5; cf. Massoud 2016: §IV; see Mullins 2021: 585–586 for a rival account that ranks options according to justifying weight instead of requiring weight.)

Simple Betterness is intended to supplement Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility. The latter claims that permissibility is determined by one competition: the justifying weight for φ vs. the requiring weight for the alternatives. The former claims that relative rankings of betterness are determined by a distinct competition: the requiring weight for φ vs. the requiring weight for the alternatives.

Simple Betterness provides a straightforward account of ought: you ought to choose the permissible option with the most requiring weight in its favor. You apply Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility to determine which options are permissible. And then you apply Simple Betterness to determine which permissible options are better than others. If there is a permissible option with more requiring weight in its favor than any other, then that’s what you ought to do even if you aren’t required to do it.

The conjunction of Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility and Simple Betterness also provides a plausible account of why save 1 is supererogatory when the only alternative is bystander. It was assumed that the altruistic reason for save 1 (that you would save one child’s life) has 100 units of justifying and requiring weight, whereas the self-interested reason for bystander (that it is your only way to avoid severe burns) has 500 justifying weight but only 5 requiring weight. Given these assumptions, §3.3 explained why Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility entails that bystander and save 1 are moral options. Simple Betterness then entails that save 1 is supererogatory (or at least better than bystander), because the 100 requiring weight for save 1 is greater than the 5 requiring weight for bystander.

Many Weight Pluralists reject Simple Betterness. They hold that relative rankings are determined, not by requiring weight, but by some third weight value. This third value has been called “merit-conferring” (Horgan & Timmons 2010), “favoring” (Portmore 2019: 188 n. 4); “commending” (Little & Macnamara 2020; Tucker 2025: ch. 8), and “erogatory” (Smith 2024). The basic idea of this approach is to let Pluralist Pairwise Permissibility determine which options are permissible and then this third value determines the relative ranking of alternatives (or, in Tucker’s case, the relative ranking of options with the same deontic status).

5. Weight and the Agent’s Context

Thus far this entry has focused on how the total weights of opposing reasons systematically interact to determine whether an option is permissible, required, supererogatory, or what you ought to do. There are two different kinds of systematic interaction that are in some sense prior to that interaction. This section and the next concern whether and how the weight of an individual reason might itself be the result of a systematic interaction between some factor and its context or circumstances. §7 concerns how the weights of individual reasons for φ combine, or aggregate, to determine the total weight of the reasons for φ that gets weighed against the total weight of the reasons for the alternatives.

5.1. Holism vs. Atomism

Atomism is the claim that a feature that is a reason for (against) φ in one context is a reason for (against) φ of the same magnitude in every other context. For example, if a promise to φ is a very weighty reason for φ today, then it is a very weighty reason for φ no matter what. Holism denies atomism. It says that a feature that is a reason for (against) φ in one context might vary in magnitude (go from strong to weak), switch directions (from for φ to against φ), or fail to be a reason at all. Dancy gives the following kinds of examples to motivate holism:

From a reason for to no reason at all: while one’s having promised to φ is generally a reason for φ, perhaps it isn’t a reason at all (for or against φ) when the promise was coerced (Dancy 2004: 38).

From a reason for to a reason against: That someone enjoys something is normally a reason for me to help them do that thing; however, that they enjoy humiliating people is a reason for me to not help them do that thing (Dancy 1993: 61; some holists, such as Cullity (2002: 173–174) and Bader (2016: 29–30), deny that this is a genuine example of holism).

From a reason for to a stronger or weaker reason for: You generally have a reason to help someone when they need help. Yet their needing help gives you more reason to help them when you are the only person around. Their needing help gives you less reason to help them when it’s their own fault that they are in this predicament (Dancy 2004: 41–42).

To clarify how context systematically makes a difference to reasons, holists generally distinguish between conditions and modifiers. Conditions are like on/off switches that determine whether something is a reason at all. An enabler is a contextual feature that makes something a reason for (against) φ when it normally isn’t a reason for (against) φ. Perhaps a creature’s sentience is what enables its wellbeing to provide reasons. On such a view, benefits to beavers would be reasons whereas benefits to bacteria wouldn’t be, precisely because only the former are sentient. A disabler is a contextual feature that prevents something from being a reason for (against) φ when it normally is a reason for (against) φ. In the coerced promise example above, coercion allegedly disables the promise to φ, it prevents the promise from being a reason when it otherwise would be.

Modifiers are more like dimming dials that don’t affect whether the light is on but rather determine only how bright it is. That is, modifiers don’t determine whether something is a reason for or against φ, but they do determine how weighty a reason it is. An amplifier makes something a weightier reason for (against) φ than it would otherwise be. An attenuator makes something a less weighty reason for (against) φ than it would otherwise be. Consider again the idea that that someone needs help is a reason for you to help them. That you are the only person around to help them is an alleged amplifier of that reason, it makes their needing help a weightier reason than it otherwise would be. That it is their fault they are in this position is an attenuator of that reason, it makes it a less weighty reason than it otherwise would be. (For more technical characterizations of the holist machinery, see Horty 2012: ch. 2; Bader 2016; Tucker 2023b; 2025: ch. 2.)

Atomism seems to have been implicitly assumed in most ethical theory until the end of the 20th century. Yet holism has been increasing in popularity, especially since the publication of Dancy’s Ethics Without Principles (2004), and it may now have the upper hand over atomism. Perhaps the most widely endorsed argument for holism is that it provides the best explanation of how special relationships, such as parental or spousal relationships, make a difference to what it is permissible to do. You can save Christy or both Amelia and Bedelia, but you can’t save all three. If Christy is your child, you are permitted, if not required, to save her over the two others. But how does her being your child make a difference? Holists argue that it makes a difference by amplifying the reason you have to promote her wellbeing, making her one life a reason that is at least as weighty as the lives of the two other children (Keller 2013: esp. 133–136, 152; Bader 2016: 42–44; Lord 2016; Tucker 2025: §2.3). Other than Dancy 2004, the most sustained argument that disablers exist is arguably Cullity 2013. In epistemology, the existence of disablers seems widely endorsed under the label of ‘undercutting defeaters’ (see, e.g., Whiting 2020: §8.2).

5.2. Particularism: The Limit of Holism

The most minimal holists allow context to make a difference in a handful of cases. The most extreme holists allow context to matter in every case. Particularism about reasons is the limit of holism. It claims that the context-sensitivity of reasons is so rampant that the principles that guide this sensitivity cannot be finitely specified.

Dancy (2004: 10, 78–85) argues that the motivations for holism lead inexorably to particularism. This claim is doubtful (Holton 2002: 197, n. 12; Tucker 2025: §2.4.1), especially since particularism faces a variety of challenges that holism doesn’t face. For example, Berker (2007) and Gert (2007a) argue that particularism is incompatible with certain commonsense features of reasons (see Lechler 2012 for a reply to Berker). While Gert (2007a) seems to think that these commonsense features of reasons lead to atomism, Cullity (2018: 426) and Tucker (2025: §2.4.1) argue that they are compatible with versions of holism that reject particularism. For more on particularism, see the entries on moral particularism and moral particularism and generalism.

5.3. Silencing Reasons: An Implication of Virtue?

Given Aristotelian accounts of virtue (Nicomachean Ethics I.13), virtuous agents have an inner harmony: their emotions and desires motivate them to perform actions that they rationally judge to be permissible. Such an agent is not even tempted to do something that violates what they are required to do. If it would be impermissibly gluttonous to eat a third donut, the virtuous agent won’t be tempted to eat it.

This entry focuses on the systematic interaction of normative reasons, which are often distinguished from motivating reasons. Very crudely, normative reasons are genuine reasons and motivating reasons are what motivates an agent to act whether or not it is a genuine normative reason. (For more on this distinction, see the entry on reasons for action: justification, motivation, explanation.) McDowell argues that, if there are genuine normative or motivating reasons to eat the (delicious) third donut, then the virtuous person would be tempted to do so; therefore, inner harmony requires that there be no normative or motivating reasons to act contrary to the requirements of virtue (1998: 46–47; cf. Vigani 2021: 750–751; Seidman 2005: 69).

This silencing, if it exists, apparently involves something that disables the reasons for eating the third donut. That Victoria would enjoy it ordinarily would be a normative reason for her to eat something. If Victoria is a virtuous agent and her enjoyment would be a normative reason in the context in which it is gluttonous to eat it, her enjoyment might motivate her (thereby becoming a motivating reason for her) to eat the donut. But if silencing involves a disabler, then that she would enjoy it fails to be a normative reason for her to eat the donut in this context, which arguably would prevent her from being motivated by it. That’s tidy.

Yet McDowell (1998: 90–93) suggests that what silences or disables the reason to eat the third donut is the “recognized requirement” to refrain from eating it (92) or the reasons that successfully “mark out [refraining] as required by virtue” (93). Either way McDowell’s view seems odd. Focus on the second suggestion. Suppose that, initially, there are no relevant disablers, there are weighty reasons to eat the donut, these weighty reasons are just barely outweighed by the reasons to refrain from eating it, and thus Victoria is required to refrain from eating it. As soon as the reasons to refrain require refraining, they disable the outweighed reasons to eat the donut, making them go out of existence. What was a close, contested victory is instantaneously converted into a landslide victory with no opposition. That’s odd.

Perhaps the most common worry about conceptions of virtue that include silencing is that they are “god-like” and not suitable ideals for humans to aspire to (e.g., Blackburn 1998: 37; Baxley 2007: 411). Seidman (2005) takes a somewhat moderate position, claiming that silencing occurs but only in a narrow range of cases. Vigani (2019, 2021) defends silencing from these worries and integrates it with empirical work on how agents interpret, or construe, the practical significance of their circumstances.

6. Exclusionary and Higher-Order Reasons

Raz (1999: 35–48) and Scanlon (1998: 51–54) argue that there are exclusionary reasons, which are (higher-order) reasons not to act or believe on certain other reasons. Such reasons have been applied heavily in political and legal theory (see Adams 2021: 235–239 for a summary). You promise your partner that, when you decide how to spend your forthcoming bonus, you will take into account only what’s best for your daughter and, specifically, your enjoyment of coffee will not be a factor. This promise is a potential example of an exclusionary reason insofar as it commits you to excluding certain factors from your deliberation. When you get your bonus, you notice that you could buy a fancy espresso machine that you would very much enjoy. Your promise doesn’t prevent your enjoyment from being a reason to buy the machine; rather, it prevents the reason from being something that you can act on, something that makes it permissible to buy the machine.

Exclusionary reasons are distinct from both conditions and modifiers. Conditions and modifiers affect the balance of reasons. Conditions do so by affecting which facts are reasons, modifiers by affecting how weighty the reasons are. In contrast, exclusionary reasons do not affect the balance of reasons. If there are exclusionary reasons, then sometimes one ought, all things considered, act against the balance of reasons concerning whether to φ. If there is no way of spending your bonus that will affect your daughter very much (she’s already very happy), then your exclusionary promise may require you to spend the money on her behalf even though the balance of reasons is strongly in favor of some other action (say, buying the espresso machine or donating to an effective charity). Raz (1999: 36–46) boasts this result as a feature of exclusionary reasons, but others regard it as a bug (Chang 2016: 220–227; Whiting 2017: 401–402; Cullity 2018: 436–438; Adams 2021: 237–238).

Exclusionary reasons, if they exist, aren’t reasons to not φ; they are reasons to not φ-for-a-particular-reason. Your promise to consider only what’s best for your daughter wasn’t a reason to not buy an espresso machine; rather, it was a reason to not buy the espresso machine for the reason that you would enjoy it. Whiting (2017) complains that, while it is possible to not φ for a reason, it is not possible to not φ-for-a-reason for a reason. This suggests that exclusionary reasons aren’t genuine reasons (cf. Adams 2021: 239). Keeling (2023) replies that, if we have the sort of control over our beliefs that makes them assessable as rational or irrational (i.e., rationally permissible or rationally impermissible), then we also have the sort of control over acting-for-a-reason that makes it assessable as rational or irrational. She concludes, then, that one can not φ-for-a-reason for a reason after all.

In epistemology, higher-order evidence is sometimes treated as an exclusionary reason. Roughly, higher-order evidence regarding P is evidence about your evidence concerning whether P, but the focus is on higher-order evidence that doesn’t make a difference to your evidence concerning whether P. As a foil, consider an epistemic case of undercutting, or disabling. It appears there is a pink elephant in front of you, so you have some evidence that there is a pink elephant in front of you. But many epistemologists think that when you discover that a hallucinogen was slipped into your coffee, the appearance is disabled as evidence and as a reason to believe that there is a pink elephant in front of you. That is, the appearance is no longer a reason for believing that there is a pink elephant and, importantly, it is no longer even evidence that there is a pink elephant in front of you. The evidence about the drug disables both your evidence for P and your reason to believe P.

Now to the focal kind of higher-order evidence (Elga 2008). You are flying an underpressurized airplane and carefully perform calculations to ensure that you have enough fuel to make it to your destination. These calculations prove that you have enough fuel. But you then notice that, at this elevation, there is a 50% chance that you have hypoxia, which causes errors in reasoning. Here the evidence about hypoxia doesn’t seem to block the calculations from being genuine evidence that you have enough fuel. One interpretation is that it nonetheless “brackets” or excludes those calculations, such that they cannot justify believing what they are genuine evidence for (Elga 2007; Christensen 2010; cf. Whiting 2020: §8.3). This interpretation of the case treats the information about hypoxia as an exclusionary reason and is subject to the same worries that afflict exclusionary reasons more generally. For introductions to higher-order evidence and alternative interpretations of such cases, see Whiting 2020 and the entry on higher order evidence.

7. The Aggregation of Weight

When you have more than one total reason for φ, how do those reasons combine, or aggregate, to determine the total reason for φ? Simple Addition is the idea that reasons for φ always aggregate by addition. This view is universally rejected because of two kinds of counterexample. The first is that derivative reasons don’t always aggregate by addition (Prakken 2005: 86; Horty 2012: 61; Drai 2018: 65–67; Hawthorne & Magidor 2018: 133–135). Here’s a representative case:

Heat & Rain: Suppose you are deliberating about an afternoon run, and that both heat and rain, taken individually, function as reason to not run; still, the combination of heat and rain together functions as a weaker reason to not run, as the heat is less onerous when there is rain.

A common response to such objections is that heat and rain are not basic or fundamental reasons to do something. A fundamental reason is not derived or in virtue of any other reason. A derived reason is a reason in virtue of some other reason. Heat and rain are arguably reasons against running only insofar as they cause misery or reductions in wellbeing. The fundamental reason at issue is something like how miserable it would be to run (Gert 2004: 77–79; Cullity 2018: 424–425; Maguire & Snedegar 2021).

The second kind of counterexample to Simple Addition is that overlapping fundamental reasons don’t always aggregate (Kearns 2016: 186; Nair 2016: 63; Hawthorne & Magidor 2018: 133–134; Maguire & Snedegar 2021: 368). You have two reasons not to shoot Vic: it would cause pain and it would cause severe pain. Neither reason is more fundamental than the other, and facts about causing pain are plausible examples of fundamental reasons. Since these fundamental reasons overlap, the total reason for not shooting Vic is not their sum.

Tucker argues that these counterexamples don’t challenge a more sophisticated version of additive aggregation, namely Restricted Addition: holding fixed all conditions and modifiers, non-overlapping fundamental reasons for maximal options always aggregate by addition (2023b: §5; 2025: §2.5; cf. Wedgwood 2022: 145–147). Wedgwood (2022) provides an argument for something like this principle by relying on various principles concerning decision theory. Restricted Addition doesn’t tell us how derivative reasons aggregate, but such reasons are already taken into account by taking into account all fundamental reasons. Nor does this principle tell us how reasons for non-maximal options aggregate; however, if maximalism is true, all reasons for non-maximal options are derivative, and the reasons for maximal options determine the deontic status of all options, whether maximal or not (see §2.4 above for a discussion of maximalism).

Formal systems, such as probabilistic confirmation, decision theory, and default logic provide a variety of resources that may illuminate the aggregation of reasons, and weighing reasons, more generally. For some important attempts to provide such illumination, see Horty 2012, Sher 2019, and Nair 2021.

8. Weighing Reasons When Normative Perspectives Conflict

So far this entry has focused on how reasons determine normative status within specific normative perspectives, especially how moral and epistemic reasons determine moral and epistemic statuses, respectively. But what happens when various specific normative perspectives conflict with each other?

Recall the possibility in which it is morally permissible to provide a certain self-sacrificial benefit to a stranger when it is prudentially impermissible to do so (§1.1). Here morality and prudence conflict. Similar conflicts may arise for belief. The evidence might epistemically require you to believe that the dictator is evil. He did after all just kidnap thousands of innocent people with plans to execute them. But suppose that the dictator would spare these people from death if and only if you disbelieve that the dictator is evil. In such a case, morality might require you to go against your evidence and disbelieve that the dictator is evil. How, if at all, are such conflicts resolved? And how, if at all, is weighing reasons related to such resolutions? (For a variety of responses to apparent conflicts between epistemic and practical reasons, see Feldman 2000, Reisner 2008, Conee 2016, Rinard 2017, Berker 2018, and Howard 2020.)

Let the supreme perspective refer to the unique normative perspective that has final authority over what to do and believe, the one that settles what to do and believe. It tells us, for example, whether a certain action or belief is permissible or required simpliciter. Theorists often deny that morality is the supreme perspective. Some of these theorists hold that morality is nonetheless so important that moral rationalism is true, i.e., that you are always required simpliciter to do what you are morally required to do. One rationale for rationalism claims that moral wrongdoing is always blameworthy from the supreme perspective (Portmore 2011: ch. 2; Darwall 2016). Others grant morality a less exalted status and deny moral rationalism (Wolf 1982: 435–439; Wolf 1992; Dorsey 2016: ch. 3).

If there is a supreme perspective—whether it is morality or not—then the verdicts of the supreme perspective settle all conflicts between normative perspectives. If the supreme perspective says that it is permissible to provide the relevant self-sacrificial benefit to the stranger, then it is permissible simpliciter to do so no matter what prudence may say about it.

From the perspective of weighing reasons, there is nothing special about the supreme perspective. Accounts of weighing reasons are primarily concerned with the internal structure of a normative perspective regardless of whether the perspective has limited or final authority (§1.1). If the supreme perspective is structured to weigh reasons (e.g., its verdicts are determined by the interaction of various competing considerations), then it presumably weighs reasons in the same way as any other normative perspective (cf. Dorsey 2016: 13–14). Furthermore, the same machinery used to explain how reasons determine normative statuses in morality and epistemic rationality—including contrastive reasons, incommensurability, Weight Pluralism, and holism—may also explain how reasons interact to determine normative statuses in the supreme perspective.

Of course, there will be some differences between the supreme perspective and other perspectives. Perhaps the supreme perspective takes a wider range of considerations into account than any other normative perspective. Or perhaps it sometimes takes the same considerations into account but weights them differently than other normative perspectives (Dorsey 2016: 35). For example, perhaps the supreme perspective gives more (requiring) weight to altruism than does prudence. And/or perhaps it gives more (requiring) weight to self-interest than does morality.

It is controversial whether a supreme perspective exists. One way to deny that a supreme perspective exists is to endorse a sort of nihilism in which nothing matters at all. On such a picture, there is no perspective with final authority, because there is no reason or normative perspective that has any authority at all. There is, however, a less extreme way to reject the existence of a supreme perspective.

Normative pluralism is the view that, while there are some normative perspectives that matter or have some authority, there is no supreme perspective, there is no perspective that has final authority (cf. Sagdahl 2022: 3; Dorsey 2016: 19). Proponents of this view hold that there are a variety of reasons and normative perspectives that have genuine, albeit limited, authority over what to do and believe. Epistemic reasons contribute to epistemic rationality, prudential reasons contribute to prudential rationality, moral reasons contribute to morality, aesthetic reasons contribute to aesthetic rationality, and so on. All of these reasons and perspectives may matter; it’s just that they are so different that they don’t integrate into an orderly normative perspective that takes them all into account. (For defenses of normative pluralism, see Copp 2007, 2009; Tiffany 2007; Feldman 2000; Conee 2016; and Sagdahl 2022.)

In effect, normative pluralism denies that weighing reasons is a way to resolve conflicts between normative perspectives. Weighing reasons concerns the systematic interaction of competing factors. Normative pluralists deny that epistemic, prudential, moral, and aesthetic reasons interact in an orderly system that takes them all into account. If the balance of each kind of reason favors φ over all alternatives, then maybe there is some sense in which φ is “all things considered” what you ought to do (cf. Sagdahl 2022: §2.4). But if morality and epistemic rationality conflict, there is no normative perspective that adjudicates this conflict, that takes all relevant reasons into account and then tells you what you ought to do simpliciter. If normative pluralism is true, our normative lives may be inevitably and irreducibly fragmented (Wolf 1982: 437–439).

While normative pluralism introduces the idea that some conflicts between normative perspectives may be unresolvable, it does not introduce any special considerations having to do with weighing reasons. Recall that prudential reasons (especially self-interested ones) and moral reasons (especially altruistic ones) are widely thought to be different kinds of reasons. Normative pluralists often worry that these reasons are so different that they don’t integrate into an orderly normative perspective. Prudence and morality may just form an irreducible, irresolvable “duality of practical reason” (Sidgwick 1884 [2009: 401]; Sagdahl 2022: ch. 3).

Other theorists are more sanguine. They hold that morality itself has a way of comparing the weights of these reasons in a systematic way. They agree with the normative pluralists that there are important qualitative differences between self-interested and altruistic reasons. To manage these differences within a single normative perspective, some theorists appeal to incommensurability and, more specifically, parity (§3.2). When there are significant qualitative differences between two reasons, they may not be able to be compared precisely enough to be equal; however, they nonetheless may be on a par or one reason may be weightier than the other. Other theorists manage the qualitative difference between self-interested and altruistic reasons by endorsing Weight Pluralism and then holding that some reasons have more justifying weight than they have requiring weight (§3.3). At present, there is scant literature on whether qualitative differences between reasons are better explained by the normative pluralist, parity, and/or Weight Pluralism (a notable exception is Sagdahl 2022: chs 4–7). Hopefully, these issues will be investigated more thoroughly in the future.

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Other Internet Resources

Acknowledgments

I am grateful to Jamie Fritz, Elizabeth Jackson, Daniel Muñoz, Douglas Portmore, Eva Schmidt, Michael Vollmer, and two SEP editors for very helpful comments on earlier drafts.

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Chris Tucker <cstucker@wm.edu>

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