Xenocrates

First published Fri Jul 25, 2003; substantive revision Wed Sep 3, 2025

As Diogenes Laertius reports (D.L., IV 14 = T 2 IP), Xenocrates (of Chalcedon, a city on the Asian side of the Bosporus opposite Byzantium) became head of the Academy after the death of Speusippus, in 339/338 (“in the second year of the 110th Olympiad”). D.L. adds that he held that position for twenty-five years and died at 82. Accordingly, his life dates are generally given as 396/395–314/313 BCE.

On the death of Plato, when Speusippus became head of the Academy, Xenocrates and Aristotle may have left Athens together at the invitation of Hermeias of Atarneus (Strabo, Geography, XIII 57), and Xenocrates returned to succeed Speusippus. According to D.L. (IV 3 = T 21 IP), this was at Speusippus’ request, while the Academicorum Index Herculanensis (cols. 6,41–7,18: Fleisher 2018, 175–176 = T 1 IP) tells us that the younger members of the Academy voted —for the first time—and confirmed Xenocrates (over Heraclides of Pontus and Menedemus of Pyrrha) by a narrow margin as the first elected head of the school. These two accounts, although not incompatible, offer two different versions of the succession, and it does not appear possible to get behind them to what really happened.

D.L.’s bibliography (IV 11–14 = T 2 IP) lists over seventy titles attributed to Xenocrates, none of which survives, not even in the form of clearly identifiable quotations in other authors. As with Speusippus, the reconstruction of Xenocrates’ doctrines depends heavily on Aristotle who, frustratingly, often refrains from naming Xenocrates explicitly. Although Aristotle never directly names Xenocrates when discussing his philosophical views, possible references to his doctrines are signalled through certain recurring formulas; for instance, when Aristotle speaks of “those who posited the Forms” (a phrase that often includes Plato and Xenocrates), of “those who posited one nature for mathematical objects and Forms,” or of “those who defined the soul as ‘self-moving number’” (more on this below).

Throughout this entry, citations of Xenocrates’ fragments follow the numbering in Isnardi Parente’s revised edition (2012), hereafter ‘IP’.

Sextus Empiricus tells us (Adv. math. I §16 = fr. 1 IP) that Xenocrates made explicit the tripartite division of philosophy that was implicit in Plato into ‘physics’, ‘ethics’, and ‘logic’. This schema later became canonical in Stoicism and Hellenistic philosophy more generally. As is standard with this terminology, what we today refer to as metaphysics and theory of knowledge are subsumed under ‘physics’ and ‘logic’, respectively. Sextus’ report about the standard division of philosophy transmitted by Xenocrates but ultimately derived from Plato is typical of much of what we hear about him: Xenocrates appears to have been at least as concerned to carry on Plato’s thought as to promote ideas of his own.

Xenocrates’ system has sometimes been read as anticipating ideas that would become prominent in the Middle Platonic tradition (e.g., Dillon 2003. For an overview of major scholarly approaches to the material preserved on the Early Academy, see the entry on Speusippus). In this entry, significant focus is placed on Aristotle’s texts, complemented by material preserved by other authors, with less emphasis on potential continuity with later traditions. What survives of Xenocrates’ views is here divided into four sections: Metaphysics, Xenocrates and the Timaeus, Theory of Knowledge, and Ethics. The available material is considerably more abundant for metaphysics, while our sources for epistemology and ethics are far more limited.

1. Metaphysics

Most of what we can reconstruct about Xenocrates pertains to his metaphysics. This reconstruction is carried out largely by identifying views of his that appear in Aristotle’s criticisms of the metaphysical doctrines of his predecessors and contemporaries, and by chaining these with other texts that can plausibly be taken to concern Xenocrates’ own views. The one feature of Xenocrates’ system that Aristotle emphasizes the most when presenting his metaphysics is his postulation of Form-Numbers. Indeed, in Aristotelian reports, Xenocrates’ position is often recognisable alongside those of Plato and Speusippus. Consider, for example, the beginning of book Λ of the Metaphysics:

There are three kinds of substance—one that is sensible (of which one subdivision is eternal and another is perishable […]); and another that is immovable, and this certain thinkers assert to be capable of existing apart, some dividing it into two, others combining the Forms and the objects of mathematics into one class, and others believing only in the mathematical part of this class. (Arist., Metaph. Λ1 1069a30–35 = fr. 26 IP, transl. Ross)

In this and similar reports, Aristotle is quite consistent in the way he presents the positions of Plato and his immediate successors. To Plato, Aristotle attributes the postulation of Forms alongside mathematical entities, mentioned here as two distinct classes of immovable substance. As for Speusippus, Aristotle states that he admitted the existence of mathematical objects only, having rejected the existence of Forms. Finally, regarding Xenocrates, Aristotle reports that he placed Forms and mathematical objects in a single class. Compare, for instance, how Aristotle frames the issue in book M:

Two opinions are held on this subject; it is said that the objects of mathematics—i.e. numbers and lines and the like—are substances, and again that the Forms are substances. And since some recognize these as two different classes—the Forms and the mathematical numbers—and some recognize both as having one nature, while some others say that the mathematical substances are the only substances, we must consider first the objects of mathematics, not qualifying them by any other characteristic […]. (Arist., Metaph. M1 1076a16–24 = fr. 27 IP, transl. Ross slightly modified)

This version of the Theory of Forms associated with Xenocrates is that which Aristotle also ascribes to the ‘later’ Plato (see Arist., Metaph. M4 1078b10–12 for the qualification ‘later’), in which the Forms are, in the first instance, numbers. In trying to understand what Aristotle tells us about Form-Numbers, it is necessary to bear in mind the fundamental distinction he draws between Form-Numbers and mathematical numbers: both are, according to Aristotle, composed of units, but the units making up Form-Numbers are of a peculiar kind, such that those within one Form-Number cannot be combined with those from any other. By contrast, the units of which mathematical numbers are composed can be freely added and subtracted (Arist. Metaph. M6, 1080a15-b4). And furthermore, there is only one Form-Number for each of the numbers 2, 3, 4, etc., where there are indefinitely many instances of each among the mathematical numbers (Arist., Metaph. A6, 987b14–18). The mathematical numbers are the ones that mathematicians work with (for example, in performing arithmetical operations) and this is presumably why they are called ‘mathematical’.

Consistently with what we have seen in the reports introduced above, Aristotle ascribes to Plato the position that there are both Form-Numbers and mathematical numbers; to Speusippus that he rejected Form-Numbers (and with them the entire theory of Forms; see the entry on Speusippus). The position Aristotle ascribes to Xenocrates is more nuanced. The core of it is that Xenocrates’ held that “the Forms and the numbers have the same nature:” that is, Form-Numbers and the mathematical numbers are essentially the same thing (Arist. Metaph. M8, 1083b1–8 = fr. 29 IP).

A series of half a dozen passages in the Metaphysics can, in consequence of this identification, be associated with Xenocrates (see, e.g., Arist., Metaph. M6, 1080b21–30 = frs. 28 IP and 39 IP; M8, 1083b1–8 = fr. 47 IP; M9, 1086a5–11 = fr. 30 IP; N3, 1090b13–1091a5 = fr. 38 IP, although Isnardi Parente is sometimes very minimal in identifying which lines refer explicitly to Xenocrates). From these passages it appears that Xenocrates considered the distinction between Forms and mathematical numbers unnecessary and therefore decided to assimilate the latter to the former, believing that mathematics can be done entirely with Form-Numbers.

However, because Aristotle is particularly insistent on the fact that mathematical operations are rendered impossible by Form-Numbers, we are, unfortunately, not told more about how Xenocrates envisioned such operations to be possible, given the incombinability of the units composing Form-Numbers. For Plato and Speusippus, the addition of 2 and 3 consists in combining a group of units that constitutes the mathematical 2 with a distinct group of units that constitutes the mathematical 3 (that numbers are such collections of units is a view that can still be found later, perhaps most importantly, given his influence, in Euclid, Elements VII def. 2). Aristotle, too, understood addition in this way, albeit with a very different underlying ontology. It is plausible, however, that this approach was unavailable to Xenocrates, given his postulation of Form-Numbers.

Accordingly, we do not know how Xenocrates understood addition. One possibility (Dancy 2021) is that he conceived of it as a kind of map: if you are on the unique Form-Number 2 and you wish to add the unique Form-Number 3 to it, you cannot, strictly speaking, do that, but taking three steps forward in the series will get you to the unique Form-Number 5, and that is what ‘2 + 3 = 5’ really means. Another possibility is that he thought it was through participation that arithmetical operations became possible. There is, however, no direct evidence to support any of these conjectures, apart from Aristotle’s repeated complaint (see Arist., Metaph. M6, 1080b28–30 = fr. 39 IP; M8, 1083b4–6 = fr. 19 IP; M9, 1086a9–11 = fr. 30 IP) that Xenocrates actually makes doing mathematics impossible Or, to put it as Aristotle does elsewhere: that Xenocrates ends up destroying mathematical number. According to Aristotle, Xenocrates is not so much explaining addition as explaining it away.

The same criticisms levelled at Xenocrates’ Form-Numbers are, although more indirectly, directed at his conception of geometrical items as well. Just as Aristotle complains that not any two units can compose the Dyad, he also objects that, for Xenocrates, not every magnitude is divisible into other magnitudes. More broadly, Aristotle suggests that Xenocrates adjusts the basic assumptions of arithmetic and geometry to suit the needs of his system, introducing ad hoc premises instead of deriving conclusions from commonly accepted mathematical principles. As with arithmetic, with geometry, too, the underlying concern is that the explanatory order of mathematics is compromised by the metaphysical and ontological commitments endorsed by Xenocrates.

The charge that, according to Xenocrates, ‘not every magnitude is divisible into other magnitude’ appears to be motivated by Xenocrates’ commitment to the existence of indivisible lines. Aristotle attributes this view to Plato in Metaphysics A9, 992a20–22, but Alexander’s commentary on the same passage adds the name of Xenocrates, in a way suggesting that Xenocrates’ endorsement of indivisible magnitudes was even more prominent or widely recognized than Plato’s (Alex. Aphr. In Arist. Metaph., 120,6–8 = fr. 49 IP; see also Simplicius In Arist. De caelo, 563,20–23= fr. 53 IP, and many other passages in the commentators in which this ascription occurs: frs. 54–67 IP).

As Proclus understood Xenocrates’ position, it applied to the Form of the line rather than to geometrical or physical magnitudes (Procl. In Tim. II, 245 23–33 = fr. 67 IP), but this is very much a minority view. Porphyry, as quoted by Simplicius in the latter’s commentary on the Physics (140,9–13 = fr. 60 IP), gives a more general formulation:

…it does not go on to infinity, but stops at some indivisibles (atoma). These however are not indivisible as being without parts and smallest, but fissile with regard to quantity and having parts, but indivisible and primary in form, supposing that there are certain primary indivisible lines, and the planes from these and primary solids. (transl. Huby and Taylor)

If we are to trust the testimony, Xenocrates might have thought he could do with the notion of a line what Aristotle was prepared to do with notions such as man. Aristotle is prepared to say that a man is indivisible, and thus a suitable unit for the arithmetician’s contemplation, in the sense that if you divide a man into two parts, what you get is not two men (see Arist. Metaph. N3, 1078a23–26). There is no consensus on the extent to which Xenocrates’ metaphysical atomism should be understood as a theory of physical minima (as Plutarch’s testimony also seems to suggest: Quaest. Plat. 8, 1007c = fr. 132 IP). Xenocrates’ postulation of the indivisible lines has important implications for his cosmology, as recently emphasized by Sedley (2021) and Alieva (2021), who explore how his mathematical and metaphysical commitments inform his broader account of the structure of the universe and of perceptibles.

Xenocrates’ espousal of indivisible magnitudes has led to the conjecture that the pseudo-Aristotelian treatise On Indivisible Lines is, at least in part, an attack on him, and that the arguments recounted in its first chapter in favour of the existence of indivisible lines, later rebutted in the treatise, might ultimately derive from Xenocrates. Unfortunately, the arguments are quite obscure, as the text is not in good shape (an admirably concise summary of the first four of these arguments may be found in Furley 1967, 105). Some of the arguments owe a lot to Zeno of Elea: that Xenocrates was influenced by Zeno is only what one would expect, and is confirmed elsewhere (see esp. the passage from Porphyry cited in part above, apud Simplicius In Arist. Phys. 140.6–18. For the connection between Xenocrates’ arguments and Zeno, see also Gemelli Marciano 2007, 132–137). For the moment, and until a better reconstruction of the treatise becomes available, its connection to Xenocrates’ doctrine cannot be assessed in more detail.

From Aristotle’s criticism of Xenocrates’ treatment of geometrical and mathematical items, it also emerges that Xenocrates sought to account for the generation of geometrical figures (see, e.g., Arist. Metaph. M6, 1080 b23–30 = fr. 39 IP; N3, 1090b21–24; 31–32 = fr. 38 IP), and that this process was somehow related to Form-Numbers. The details of how this connection was conceived, however, remain elusive. Yet, the very need to clarify the transition from Form-Numbers to geometrical items brings into focus a point that is consistently emphasized by the early sources: Xenocrates’ commitment to the continuity of the system, in contrast to the fragmented structure of the universe postulated by Speusippus.

In Metaphysics Z2, for instance (1028b19–21 = fr. 23 IP), after introducing the identification of Forms and mathematical numbers, Aristotle makes a comment about the rest of the universe:

But some say that the Forms and the numbers have the same nature, while the others, lines and planes, come next, {and so on} down to the substance of the heavens and to the perceptibles. (transl. Dancy)

It appears that Xenocrates pictured the universe as unfolding in some sequence from Form-Numbers to geometrical items, and finally to perceptible things. Compared to that of Speusippus, whose universe Aristotle portrays as discontinuous or disjointed, Xenocrates’ unfolding of the universe from higher principles appears markedly more continuous. For one thing, Xenocrates renounces the many principles that Speusippus had introduced for each level of reality, and instead appeals to just two ultimate principles: the One and the Indefinite Dyad (see Aëtius, I, 7 30 = fr. 133 IP; Plutarch, De an. procr. in Tim., 1012 d2-f1= fr. 108 IP; Theophrastus, Metaph. 6b1 = fr. 20 IP). Some scholars have argued that, in Xenocrates’ system, the two principles are not entirely equal in status, and that the Indefinite Dyad is ultimately dependent on or subordinate to the One, a reading that reinforces the unity and hierarchical structure of his metaphysics. A prominent version of this view is offered by Thiel (2006), who, following Krämer, reconstructs Xenocrates’ thought in light of Plato’s so-called ‘unwritten doctrines’ and presents him as formalising these into a tightly integrated metaphysical framework. Thiel’s argument for the subordination of the Dyad relies chiefly on a passage in Sextus Empiricus (Adv. math. X §248–283), which he takes to preserve genuinely Xenocratean material. The passage is, however, not treated as a genuine report on Xenocrates in Isnardi Parente’s collection, and the early sources offer no clear support for the view that Xenocrates considered the Dyad subordinate to the One.

Further evidence for the continuity and comprehensiveness of Xenocrates’ system is preserved by Theophrastus. In his Metaphysics, Theophrastus complains that Pythagoreans and the Platonists fail to give us a full story about the construction of the universe: they just go so far and stop (6a23-b1).

At present, however, having arrived at a certain [point], many, certainly, stop completely, as do too those who posit the one and the indefinite dyad; for having generated numbers and planes and solids, they leave out almost everything else except to the extent of apprehending and declaring only this much, that some things are [generated] from the indefinite dyad […] and others from the numbers and the one […]—but of the heavens and the rest they make no further mention whatsoever.

Then he says (6b6–10):

And likewise neither do those around Speusippus nor anyone of the others except Xenocrates; for he does somehow provide everything about the universe, alike sensibles, intelligibles, mathematicals, and, what is more, the divine [things]. (transl. Gutas (2010). For the commentary, see 311–312)

So, while Aristotle portrays Xenocrates’ account of the universe as granting continuity to the universe (in contrast to that of Speusippus), Theophrastus emphasizes its comprehensiveness: Xenocrates provides an account that encompasses every level of reality, from intelligibles to perceptibles (on Xenocrates’ bridging of metaphysical entities to perceptibles, see Horky 2022).

Besides offering a general breakdown of the components of Xenocrates’ world (an attempt to reconcile this evidence with other testimonia can be found in Horky 2013), Theophrastus’ mention of ‘divine things’ is particularly noteworthy. The claim that these, too, received a specific account and were accommodated within the system appears to reflect a broader tendency, already detectable in Plato’s later dialogues, and further developed within the Academy (especially in the Epinomis; see Aronadio-Tulli-Petrucci 2018 and Calchi 2020), to associate traditional gods with metaphysical principles and celestial bodies, thus drawing theology into the domain of metaphysics (for this tendency in the Academy, see Thiel 2006; Dillon 2020; Bartninkas 2023). A passage in Aëtius (Aëtius, I, 7 30 = fr. 133 IP, see Mansfeld-Runia 2020, 400 n. ad §20) seems to reflect precisely this kind of theological-metaphysical integration. It reports that Xenocrates identified the One and the Dyad as gods — the former male, the latter female—, regarded the heavenly bodies as divine, and populated his sublunary world with daimones. How much of the information preserved in this testimony can be taken at face value is difficult to determine, as reconciling its details with what we know of Xenocrates’ metaphysics raises several problems (as Dillon 2003 rightly notes, against the interpretation proposed by Baltes 1988 and largely accepted by Thiel 2006). Yet, even if the specifics are uncertain, this and similar passages still testify to the general tendency to bridge metaphysics and theology.

We hear more about the gods, daimones, and men from Plutarch, who tells us (De defectu oraculorum 416c-d = fr. 142 IP) that Xenocrates associated them with types of triangles: gods with equilateral ones, daimones with isosceles ones, and men with scalene triangles. Just as isosceles triangles are intermediate between equilateral and scalene triangles, so daimones occupy an intermediate position between gods and men. Another version of this association between the souls of daimones and triangles is recorded by Proclus (Procl. In Resp. 2, 48,4ff. Kroll = fr. 143 IP). More generally, Xenocrates appears to have been the first to develop Plato’s scattered references to the ‘daimonion’ into a more systematic daemonological framework (Timotin 2012). On Xenocrates’ view, daemons can seemingly be good or evil, but in some testimonia, individual souls themselves appear to be identified with their daemons, whose moral stature determines their happiness, as Aristotle records (Arist. Topics II, 6 112a 32–37 = fr. 154 IP).

In addition, there are isolated snatches of other views of Xenocrates that might fall under the heading ‘metaphysics’.

Simplicius, in his commentary on Aristotle’s Categories (In Arist. Cat. 63.22–5 Kalbfleisch = fr. 15 IP) tells us that Xenocrates objected to Aristotle’s list of ten categories defending that all that was needed was the distinction —already outlined by Plato in the (Sophist 255c-d) — between things that are ‘by virtue of themselves’ and things that are ‘relative to something’ (Dancy 1999; Granieri 2021).

A text preserved in Arabic (Pines 1961; the text is re-printed in Isnardi Parente’s edition as fr. 42) has Alexander of Aphrodisias criticizing Xenocrates for saying that the species is prior to the genus on the grounds that, just as parts are prior to wholes, the genus, being an element in the definition of the species, is a part of it (the most recent discussion of the material, along with a translation of the passage, can be found in Rashed 2004).

A long passage in Themistius’ Paraphrase of Aristotle’s De anima (= frs. 178–180 IP, new critical edition by García Valverde 2024) seems to stem from Xenocrates’ On Nature (at 11.37–12.1 Themistius says “It is possible to gather all these {things} from the On Nature of Xenocrates”). This is a discussion of a story about the composition of the soul from the Form-Numbers 1, 2, 3, and 4 (although 1 was not normally considered a number), mentioned in Arist. De anima 408b18–27. The motivation for this account of the soul, in both Aristotle and Themistius, is the explanation of how we can know things about the universe: the universe derives from those numbers, and so, if the soul is similarly derived, the soul can know things under the principle that like things are known by like. It remains uncertain, however, how much of this account can be securely attributed to Xenocrates.

2. Xenocrates and the Timaeus

A very puzzling definition of the soul is attributed to Xenocrates: the soul is “a self-moving number” (see Aristotle, De Anima I, 2 404b27–30 = fr. 85 IP. The ascription to Xenocrates is supported by a substantial number of testimonia collected by Isnardi Parente as frs. 85–132 IP). Unfortunately, the sources tell us little about the philosophical gist of this definition, which Aristotle says is introduced to account for the soul’s motive and cognitive functions, but which he criticizes in various occasions (e.g., Topics III, 6 120b 3–4 = fr. 87 IP. On Aristotle’s criticism of Xenocrates’ definition of the soul, see Carter 2019, 103–122).

Thanks to Plutarch, however, we have some further insight into Xenocrates’ psychology. In the De animae procreatione in Timaeo we find the following description:

Since, however, of the men most highly esteemed some were won over by Xenocrates, who declared the soul’s essence to be number itself being moved by itself, and others adhered to Crantor of Soli, who makes the soul a mixture of the intelligible nature and of the opinable nature of perceptible things, I think that the clarification of these two when exposed will afford us something like a key-note. The former believes that nothing but the generation of number is signified by the mixture of the indivisible and divisible being, the one being indivisible and multiplicity divisible and number being the product of these when the one bounds multiplicity and inserts a limit in infinitude, which they call indefinite dyad too […]. But they believe that this number is not yet soul, for it lacks motivity and mobility but that after the commingling of sameness and difference, the latter of which is the principle of motion and change while the former is that of rest, then the product is soul, soul being a faculty of bringing to a stop and being at rest no less than of being in motion and setting in motion. (Plut. De an. procr. in Tim. 1012 d2-f1 = fr. 108IP, transl. Cherniss)

Setting aside the issue of the reliability of its sources (the information is possibly mediated through Eudorus, and thus to be taken with caution), Plutarch’s testimony offers more than a bare definition: it provides a glimpse into Xenocrates’ broader account of the soul. First, we learn that the definition is introduced in the context of interpreting Timaeus 35a, a key passage for early Platonists, who frequently used the Timaeus’ psychogony to formulate their own views of the soul. Second, Plutarch presents Xenocrates as conceiving of the Timaean psychogony as a two-stage process (a pattern followed by ancient Platonists down to Proclus; see Opsomer 2020). The first stage consists in the generation of Number, understood as a mixture of the One and the Indefinite Dyad, here identified with indivisible and divisible being, respectively. Then, this numerical mixture is combined with Sameness and Difference identified as principles of motion/change and rest, respectively, so that Number may acquire the capacities for motion, change, and permanence that are essential to the soul.

Many aspects of Xenocrates’ account remain obscure. Should the Number mentioned here be identified with Form-Numbers? Why the emphasis on the soul’s capacity for self-motion, a feature not emphasised (and arguably even denied) in the Timaeus (see Petrucci 2018, 280–281 for discussion)? For this reason, some interpreters (e.g., Sedley 2021) have suggested that the Phaedrus also forms part of the background. Given Xenocrates’ seeming reception of themes developed in Plato’s later dialogues, his pronounced theological interests, and his tendency to associate cosmic components with divine entities, it is not implausible to suppose that Laws X also contributes to the picture.

Xenocrates is also mentioned in connection with the so-called ‘metaphorical’ interpretation of the cosmogony in the Timaeus, according to which some early Platonists claimed that Plato’s account of the world’s ‘generation’ was meant as a pedagogical device (Centrone 2010; on the topic, see also Reydams-Schils 2012; Dillon 2012). According to these Platonists, Plato did not mean to suggest that the world ever came to be in time: its generation was an illustrative metaphor, just as geometers make their figures clearer by showing them in the process of being drawn. The earliest source for this information is Aristotle (De caelo I 10, 279b32–280a2 = fr. 73 IP), who refers only to “some people”. It is Simplicius who reports that Aristotle had in mind above all ‘Xenocrates and the Platonists’ (In Cael. 303,34–304,16 = fr. 74 IP) and the same identification is found in an anonymous scholion, which explicitly names both Speusippus and Xenocrates as attempting to ‘come to the rescue’ of Plato (Scholia in Arist. De Caelo 409a9–12 Brandis = fr. 76 IP). The De caelo testimony itself is, however, less explicit than much of the scholarship has assumed. First, Aristotle consistently attributes to these unnamed Platonists the claim that the world is ‘indestructible and yet generated.’ Second, Aristotle rejects the comparison with diagrams by appealing to the text of the Timaeus (Tim. 30a): order, he says, cannot arise from disorder without a process of generation and therefore without time; by contrast, in diagrams nothing is separated in time. But why would Aristotle use a literal reading of the Timaeus to reject a supposedly metaphorical interpretation? Dörrie and Baltes (1998) argue that Aristotle’s rejection of the metaphor is a petitio principii. For further discussion, see De Cesaris 2023a. It is likely, then, that the later Platonist tradition played a role in developing the early Platonists’ view into a more explicit affirmation of the world’s ungeneratedness.

3. Theory of Knowledge

As already noted, the theory of knowledge comes under the heading ‘logic’ in Sextus Empiricus. No one reports anything for Xenocrates about what we would think of as ‘pure’ logic; Sextus (Adv. math. VII §147–149 = fr. 2 IP) gives us a scrap about epistemology. Xenocrates is supposed to have divided all substances or beings into three groups: perceptible, intelligible, and believable (also referred to as ‘composite’ and ‘mixed’). The intelligible ones were objects of knowledge, which Xenocrates called ‘epistemonic logos’ or ‘knowing account’, and they were ‘located’ outside the heavens. The perceptible ones were objects of perception, which was a faculty capable of attaining truth but not the same truth as knowledge; they were within the heavens. The composite ones were the heavenly bodies themselves, and they were objects of belief, which is sometimes true and sometimes false.

This classification of beings likely goes back to Plato’s image of the divided line (Republic VI, 509d-511e), which Xenocrates appears to have reworked. His tripartite division of objects recalls the one found in Aristotle, Metaphysics Λ1.

The phrase ‘epistemonic logos’ is one Sextus also assigns to Speusippus and Democritus (Adv. math. VII §145); it also recalls discussions in Aristotle (e.g. Arist. Metaph. Z15) and the end of Plato’s Theaetetus. While it is difficult to pin down what precisely Xenocrates meant by this, an ‘epistemonic logos’ seems to correspond to an account that is constitutive of, or equivalent to, knowledge.

The intelligible domain must have included the Form-Numbers dealt with above, which was also, as mentioned, the domain of mathematics, while the special place accorded to the heavens seems to explain Xenocrates’ interest for astronomy, as witnessed by the fact that one of the items in D.L.’s bibliography is ‘On Astronomy, 6 books’.

As to the sensible domain, an important testimony preserved in Porphyry (In Ptol. Harm. 31,1–6 = fr. 6 IP; for a defense of the authenticity of the content, see Alieva 2018) offers valuable insight into Xenocrates’ account of sense perception, particularly hearing. The passage is introduced as Xenocrates’ report of how Pythagoras discovered that musical intervals are grounded in numerical ratios, and it includes a detailed account of the mechanics of hearing. Sound (phōnē), it is said, originates with an impact and travels in a straight line towards the sense organ, which it sets in motion, thereby producing perception. This impact occurs in an instant, which is imperceptible to the senses due to their weakness. To illustrate this, Xenocrates draws on a visual analogy: when a spinning cone bears a single-coloured point or line, it appears as a continuous surface of colour. Likewise, the ear, unable to register the intervals of silence between discrete impacts, forms an impression (phantasia) of continuous sound (Alieva 2018). Hearing, Xenocrates adds, is ‘more disturbed’ than vision, but the explanatory model appears to be shared across modalities. Notably, despite their imprecision, the senses are not considered unreliable: although they cannot grasp ‘what is exact’ (to akribēs) — that is, they fail to apprehend their objects with full precision —, they are nonetheless able to convey some degree of truth. As Raffa (2016, 727) has emphasized, Xenocrates presents the senses as reliably reporting perceptible distinctions such as pitch, colour, or form. Moreover, our perceptual faculties are said to naturally recoil from stimuli that are disordered (such as unpleasant smells or anti-melodic sounds), while they respond favourably to those structured by numerical proportion. Xenocrates’ account thus acknowledges both the limitations and the cognitive value of the senses, embedding them within what appears to be a unified explanatory framework in which perception, though incapable of yielding knowledge, offers epistemically meaningful access to reality. In this context, music and sound are not exceptions but serve as paradigmatic illustrations of the dynamic interplay between sensory input and intelligible structure.

4. Ethics

Here we are very much in the dark: what we have are mostly disconnected snippets.

Aristotle names Xenocrates twice in the Topics. First, at II 6. 112a37–38 (= fr. 154 IP), he ascribes to Xenocrates the view that a happy man is one with a good soul, along with the claim that one’s soul is one’s daimon. Then, at VII 1. 152a7–9 (= fr. 158 IP) he attributes to him an argument according to which the good life and the happy life are the same, for both are the most choiceworthy.

A clearer, albeit much later, report comes from Clement of Alexandria, who ascribes to Xenocrates the view that happiness consists in the possession of the appropriate virtue and the power necessary to act in accordance with it. Clement continues:

Then, as if he wants to say where it resides, he clearly indicates the soul. For the originating causes, he points to the virtues; for its component parts he points to noble actions, and states, dispositions, motions and attitudes of high morality; for its necessary concomitants he points to physical and external circumstances. (Clement, Strom. ii 133 5 = fr. 150 IP, transl. Ferguson)

The passage, remarkably rich for a doxographical source, suggests that Xenocrates defined happiness as a structured whole that encompasses not only the stable possession of virtue, but also a practical capacity to enact it. Notably, the internal conditions (states, dispositions, actions) are given priority, while physical and external goods are included as necessary conditions but not constitutive parts (more on the testimony can be found in De Cesaris 2023b).

Plutarch (De communibus notitiis 1069e-f = fr. 151 IP) attributes to Xenocrates the idea that happiness consists in living according to nature. Other reports convey related ideas, such as Xenocrates’ description of philosophical life as the “cessation of disturbance” ([Galen], Hist. phil. 8 = fr. 171 IP), a formulation that foreshadows Hellenistic ideals of tranquillity (ataraxia), though this is not made central in any extant account. These views, if genuine, seems to aim to the same sorts of goals that were typical of later Hellenistic schools.

Although there is no reason to be overly sceptical about possible lines of continuity (after all, Xenocrates’ scolarchate is marked by the transition into the Hellenistic period) our ability to assess the relationship between his ethics and later doctrines remains limited. Much of the evidence comes from later sources, particularly Cicero and Clement, and may reflect Antiochus of Ascalon’s project of harmonising Academic and Stoic doctrines. As a result, while there are suggestive overlaps, it remains difficult to determine how far Xenocrates’ ethics genuinely prefigure Hellenistic concerns, and how much is the product of later reinterpretation within a reconciliatory agenda.

Bibliography

Primary Literature

Available collections of fragments:

  • Heinze, R., 1892 [1965], Xenocrates, Stuttgart: Teubner, 1892; reprinted, Hildesheim: G. Olms, 1965.
  • Isnardi Parente, M., 1982, Senocrate-Ermodoro: Frammenti, Naples: Bibliopolis, 1982; includes an Italian translation of the fragments.
  • Isnardi Parente, M., 2012, Senocrate-Ermodoro: Frammenti, edizione rivista e aggiornata da T. Dorandi, Pisa: Edizioni della Normale.

Secondary Literature

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  • Aronadio, F., Tulli, M., Petrucci, F., 2018, [Plato] Epinomis, Napoli: Bibliopolis.
  • Baltes, M. 1988. “Zur Theologie des Xenokrates”, in R. van den Broek et al. (eds.), Knowledge of God in the Graeco-Roman World, Leiden: Brill, 43–68.
  • Bartninkas, V., 2023, Traditional and Cosmic Gods in Later Plato and the Early Academy, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Burnyeat, M.F., 1987, “Platonism and Mathematics: A Prelude to Discussion,” in A. Graeser (ed.), Mathematics and Metaphysics in Aristotle, Bern & Stuttgart: Verlag Paul Haupt, 213–240.
  • Calchi, V,. 2023, The Theology of the Epinomis, Abingdon; New York: Routledge.
  • Carter, J., 2019, Aristotle on Earlier Greek Psychology. The Science of Soul, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Centrone, B., 2010, “L’esegesi del Timeo nell’antica Accademia,” in F. Celia, A. Ulacco (eds.), Il “Timeo”: esegesi greche, arabe, latine, Pisa: Pisa University Press, 57–80.
  • Cherniss, Harold, 1944 [1962], Aristotle’s Criticism of Plato and the Academy (Volume I), Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press, 1944; reprinted, New York: Russell & Russell, 1962.
  • Dancy, R.M., 1999, “The Categories of Being in Plato’s Sophist 255c–e,” Ancient Philosophy, 19: 45–72.
  • –– 2021, “Xenocrates”, The Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy (Summer 2021 Edition), Edward N. Zalta (ed.), URL = <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/sum2021/entries/xenocrates/>.
  • De Cesaris, G., 2023a, “The So-Called Sempiternalism of the Early Academy”, Méthexis, 35: 5–28.
  • –– 2023b, “La virtù nell’Academia Antica: il caso di Senocrate,” in A. Motta (ed.), Platone e la questione della virtù, Napoli: Loffredo Editore, 179–194.
  • Dillon, J., 2003, The Heirs of Plato: A Study of the Old Academy (347–274 BC), Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • –– 2012, “The Timaeus in the Old Academy,” in Id. The Platonic Heritage. Further Studies in the History of Platonism and Early Christianity, London: Routledge, 80–94.
  • –– 2020, “The World-Soul Takes Command: The Doctrine of the World-Soul in the Epinomis of Philip of Opus and in the Academy of Polemon,” in C. Helmig (ed.), World Soul – Anima Mundi: On the Origins and Fortunes of a Fundamental Idea, Berlin: De Gruyter, 155–66.
  • Dörrie, H., Baltes, M., 1998, Der Platonismus in der Antike. Die philosophisce Lehre des Platonismus, Stuttgart-Bad Cannstatt.
  • Fleischer, K. J., 2018, Philodem, Geschichte der Akademie, Leiden: Brill.
  • Furley, David, 1967, Two Studies in the Greek Atomists, Princeton, New Jersey: Princeton University Press.
  • García Valverde, J.M., 2024, Themistius. Paraphrase of Aristotle, De anima. Berlin-Boston: De Gruyter.
  • Gemelli Marciano, L., 2007, Democrito e l’Accademia. Studi sulla trasmissione dell’atomismo antico da Aristotele a Simplicio, Berlin-New York: De Gruyter.
  • Granieri, R., 2021, “Xenocrates and the Two-Category Scheme,” Apeiron, 54: 261–285.
  • Gutas, D., 2010, Theophrastus On First Principles (known as his Metaphysics), Leiden-Boston: Brill.
  • Heath, T.L., 1926 [1956], The Thirteen Books of Euclid’s Elements (3 volumes), 2nd edition, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1926; reprinted, New York: Dover, 1956.
  • Horky P.S., 2013, “Theophrastus on Platonic and ”Pythagorean“ imitation’,” The Classical Quarterly, 63: 686–712.
  • Horky, Philip Sidney, 2013, “Theophrastus on Platonic and ‘Pythagorean’ Imitation”, Classical Quarterly, 63: 686–712.
  • –– 2022, “Aristotle’s Intermediates and Xenocrates’ Mathematicals,” Revue de Philosophie Ancienne, 40: 79–112.
  • Isnardi Parente, Margherita, 2012, Senocrate-Ermodoro: Frammenti, Naples: Bibliopolis, 1982 (includes an Italian translation of the fragments); new, revised edition, by T. Dorandi, Pisa: Edizioni della Normale.
  • Mansfeld, J., Runia, D, 2020, Aëtiana V (4 vols.). An Edition of the Reconstructed Text of the Placita with a Commentary and a Collection of Related Texts, Leiden: Brill.
  • Opsomer, J, 2020, “The Platonic Soul. From the Early Academy to the First Century BCE,” in J. Warren, B. Inwood (eds.), The Metaphysics of the Soul, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 171–198.
  • Petrucci, F., 2022, “Platone. Timeo”. Introduzione a cura di F. Ferrari, Milano: Fondazione Lorenzo Valla (Mondadori).
  • Pines, S., 1961, “A New Fragment of Xenocrates and Its Implications,” Transactions of the American Philological Association, 51: 3–34.
  • Raffa, M., 2016, Claudio Tolemeo. Armonica. Con il Commentario di Porfirio, Milano: Bompiani.
  • Rashed, M., 2004, “Priorité de l’EΙΔΟΣ ou du ΓΕΝΟΣ entre Andronicos et Alexandre: Vestiges Arabes et Grecs Inédits,” Αrabic Sciences and Philosophy, 14: 9–63.
  • Reydams-Schils, G., 2012, “The Academy, the Stoics and Cicero on Plato’s Timaeus,” in A.G. Long (ed.), Plato and the Stoics, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Ross, W.D., & F.H. Fobes, 1929 [1967], Theophrastus: Metaphysics, Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1929; reprinted, Hildesheim: Georg Olms, 1967.
  • Sedley, D., 2021, “Xenocrates’ Invention of Platonism,” in M. Erler, J.E. Heßler, F.M. Petrucci (eds.), with the collaboration of M. McOsker, Authority and Authoritative Texts in the Platonist Tradition, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 12–37.
  • Thiel, D., 2006, Die Philosophie des Xenokrates im Kontext der Alten Akademie, Munich-Leipzig: Saur Verlag.
  • Timotin, A., 2012, La démonologie platonicienne. Histoire de la notion de daimōn de Platon aux derniers néoplatoniciens, Brill: Leiden-Boston.
  • Watts, Edward, 2007, “Creating the Academy: Historical Discourse and the Shape of Community in the Old Academy,” The Journal of Hellenic Studies, 127: 106–122.

Other Internet Resources

[Please contact the author with suggestions.]

Acknowledgments

As of the 2025 update, Giulia De Cesaris has taken responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry.

Copyright © 2025 by
Giulia De Cesaris <giulia.decesaris@unito.it>
Russell Dancy

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