Importance of the SEP's Publishing Model
The combination of features exhibited by the SEP publishing model distinguishes it from other attempts to build scholarly resources on the web. Our implementation has the following features: (1) a password-protected web interface for authors, which allows them to download entry templates, submit private drafts for review, and remotely edit/update their entries; (2) a protected web interface for the subject editors, which allows them to add new topics, commission new entries, referee unpublished entries and updates (updates can be displayed with the original and updated versions side-by-side with the differences highlighted) and accept/reject entries and revisions; (3) a particularly secure web interface for the principal editor, by which the entire collaborative process can be managed with a very small staff (the principal editor can add people, add entries, assign entries to editors, issue invitations, track deadlines, publish entries and updates, etc.). (4) a tracking system which logs the actions taken at the web interfaces, monitors the state of every entry, determines who owes work and when, automatically sends occasional, friendly email reminders, and provides a summary to the principal editor; (5) software which dynamically cross-references the SEP when new entries are published, and which periodically checks for broken links throughout the content; (6) software which automatically creates archives every quarter, providing the proper basis for scholarly citation; and (7) mirror sites at universities in other parts of the world, which provide faster access to readers worldwide, provide access when the Stanford server is down for maintenance, and safeguard the digital content as extra backups.
The importance of the SEP's model is its ability to deliver, with very low administrative and production costs, quality content meeting the highest of academic standards via a medium that is universally accessible. Our model represents a new digital library concept. To see this, consider that electronic journals: (1) do not update the articles they publish, (2) do not aim to publish articles on a comprehensive set of topics, but rather, for the most part, publish articles that are randomly submitted by the members of the profession, (3) do not aim to cross-reference and create links among the concepts used in the articles they publish, (4) typically serve a narrow audience of specialists, and (5) do not have to deal with the asynchronous activity of updating, refereeing, and tracking separate deadlines for entries, since they are published on a synchronized schedule. Moreover, preprint exchanges not only exhibit features (1), (2), (3), and (4), but also do not referee their publications and so need not incorporate a work-flow system that handles the asynchronous refereeing process that occurs between upload and publication in a dynamic reference work. None of this is to say that electronic journals and preprint exchanges have a faulty design, but rather that a dynamic reference work is a distinctive new kind of publication that represents a new digital library concept. As far as we know, no other dynamic reference work has been built to the above specifications.
We don't know of any other encyclopedia project available on the web with the combination of dynamic and scholarly features of the SEP. Either they (1) are not free but rather costly and behind a subscription wall, invisible to search engines and so not as useful to academics and the general public; (2) don't have an administrative system which is as responsive to research as our model -- the authors/editors can't directly contact their server to update/vet the content of the entries; and (3) lack a system of archives for stable, scholarly citation -- when entries change, the old content is just lost, and any citations or quotations of prior content become impossible to verify, or (4) lack an Advisory Board to vet the members of its Editorial Board.
A very important feature of our model is regular archiving. With a dynamic reference work, material may change or disappear when the entry is revised or updated. To provide stable scholarly citations, we create quarterly snapshots (Spring, Summer, Fall, and Winter Editions) of the SEP and house them in a special Archives area <https://plato.stanford.edu/archives/>. Every entry contains a link to its complete archival history, identifying the fixed edition the reader should cite.