If You Choose To Write Your Entry in HTML

• 1. Linking from the Main Entry to Supplementary Documents
• 2. Special Characters
• 3. Formatting the Related Entries Section in HTML
• 4. Formatting Footnotes in HTML

We have adopted the “XHTML 1.0 Transitional” markup language as the standard for formatting Encyclopedia entries. If you choose to write your entry in HTML, you must submit a file that parses as valid XHTML 1.0 Transitional, according to the validating service at:

• http://validator.w3.org/

It is far more work for us to fix broken HTML than it is to convert Word or LaTeX documents to HTML. So, unless you are confident that you can produce HTML that is clean and internationally compliant, we recommend that you use Word or LaTeX.

For those who choose to submit an HTML sourcefile, you have two options: (a) write the document in raw HTML without the assistance of an HTML-editor, or (b) use an HTML-editor to graphically edit and format your document. In either case, you will need to download either our Tar/Gzipped Annotated Sourcefiles, or the HTML Entry Template. The Annotated Sourcefiles include “HTML comments” that explain the formatting, and include sample content that will have to be replaced by your own content. The Entry Template, by contrast, has no annotations or sample content. Once you download, unzip, and untar the Sourcefiles, or download the Entry Template file, you can open the HTML files in a plain text editor or a graphical HTML-editor and begin editing. (Note: if you want to see the annotations in the annotated sourcefiles, these will have to be opened in a plain text editor, for the HTML formatting code makes the comments invisible when rendered by graphical HTML-editing systems.)

1. Linking from the Main Entry to Supplementary Documents

Note that it is easy to create a link from your main entry to supplementary documents containing overly technical or scholarly material that would interfere with the presentation of the main ideas. To create a link from the main document to a supplementary document, suppose that the main document is entitled “index.html” and the supplementary document is entitled “supplement.html”. Now suppose that at the end of a paragraph, you wish place a labeled link to the supplementary document. Here is what the link might be displayed as:

... . We discuss this last point in further detail in the following supplementary document:

Supplement on [Title of Supplement]

Authors using an HTML-editor will have to use the functions provided by their software to create such a link. However, authors who can edit their HTML sourcefiles directly would insert the following HTML code in order to produce this link to the supplementary document:

...in the following supplementary document.
<blockquote>
<a href="supplement.html" id="return-1">Supplement on [Title of Supplement]</a>
</blockquote>

Note that this can be done in other places in your main document, if you have more than one supplementary document. (You will have to name your supplements as “supplement1.html”, “supplement2.html”, etc.) You can find the sourcefile for the supplement template here (use the View Source function of your browser after following this link).

2. Using Special Characters

We allow the use of widely supported Unicode characters. We have drawn up a page of symbols, which we believe to be widely supported among current web browsers, though many do not work with older browsers and/or older operating systems (and this is noted at the top of every entry in the SEP which uses one of these special characters).

So, if you need special punctuation characters, special accented Latin characters, Greek characters, logic and/or mathematical symbols, Polish characters, etc., please visit our page:

Widely Supported XHTML/HTML4 and Unicode Characters

Note that you can use the formatting code that appears in either the 2nd or 3rd column of this table in your HTML source file.

There are various tricks one can use in HTML for formatting these symbols in the complicated ways needed by logicians and mathematicians. For example, to get a web browser to display the word “Gödel” properly, note that you will find “ö” (= “&#246;”) in the list of Latin Characters (in the section by that name on the webpage listed above). It indicates that you can get the browser to display the umlauted character by placing either the character entity “&ouml;” or “&#246;” in your text. Thus, to produce the word “Gödel”, you place the expression “G&ouml;del” or “G&#246;del” in your HTML source file.

We have set up table that shows you the HTML codes to use for more sophisticated kinds of mathematical and logical formatting. Please have a look at:

Mathematics HTML Sampler

As another example, note that the “set membership” relation ∈, the logical symbols ∀, ∃, and ≡, and the Greek symbol φ can all found in the list of symbols on our page Widely Supported XHTML/HTML4 and Unicode Characters. Now to produce the formatted line:

∃x∀y(y∈x ≡ y∈A & φ)

use the following sequence of HTML markup in your entry, where <em> … </em> is the formatting environment for italics:

&exist;<em>x</em>&forall;<em>y</em>(<em>y</em>&isin;<em>x</em> &equiv; <em>y</em>&isin;<em>A</em> &amp; &phi;)

In some cases, however, the symbol you will need is not widely supported in web browsers. Therefore, if you do not find the symbol you need on our page Widely Supported XHTL/HTML4 and Unicode Characters, you can check our page:

Special Symbols Not Widely Supported

For example, we have produced the following graphics for the “dproves” and the “not-dproves” signs, respectively:

These symbols can be found on the Special Symbols Not Widely Supported page and you can download them onto your machine from there. Follow the links to “dproves.jpg” and “not-dproves.jpg” in the table of special symbols. You can then save those graphics onto the drive of your local computer.

If you are using an HTML-editor to create your entry, then you simply use your software's “add image” (“add graphic”) function to place these graphics on a line in your entry. However, those authors who are editing their HTML sourcefiles directly should use the following guidelines. To produce the formatted line:

A B

place the file “dproves.jpg” into the directory containing your HTML entry and use the following HTML code in your entry:

<em>A</em> <img src="dproves.jpg" alt="dproves" /> <img src="dproves.jpg" alt="dproves" /> <em>B</em>

Note that you will not need to transfer the graphics to the same directory on plato.stanford.edu when you transfer your entry to us — the first time you view your file on our server after uploading it, our software will recognize the links to our graphics and it will automatically install copies of the needed graphic files into your upload directory.

You may use any graphic found in our symbols page in this way. If you need a symbol not found on that page, write to the editor—symbols are easily constructed.

3. Formatting the Related Entries Section in HTML

If you would like to create the links to related entries yourself, then here is how you proceed. (This only works for published entries, since you won't be able to discover the canonical directory (folder) names for projected but unpublished entries.) Say you are writing an entry on Frege and you wish to create a link to the entry on Davidson in the Related Entries section. The line in the HTML sourcefile which does this will look like this:

<a href="../davidson/">Davidson, Donald</a>

The part of the code which creates the link is the bit:

<a href="...">...</a>

You fill in the first ellipsis with the location of the file you want to link to, and you fill in the second ellipsis with the label on the link you want a web browser to display. In the example, the location of the entry on Davidson is “../davidson/”. (The string “davidson” here is the canonical name of the directory containing the entry on Davidson.) This is server code which tells the browser to request the default file in the directory “davidson” which appears in the parent directory (“../”) of the current directory. In our example, since we are writing on Frege, we assume that the current directory contains the entry on Frege and so if the browser goes to the parent directory (which is the “entries” directory containing all the entries) and then down to the “davidson” directory, it will find the default file.

Now you can find out the canonical name of the directory containing the entry on Davidson by visiting the entry on Davidson in the Encyclopedia. When you reach it, you will see that the URL is:

https://plato.stanford.edu/entries/davidson/

The last field of this string is “davidson”, and that is the canonical name of the directory containing the entry on Davidson.

4. Formatting Footnotes in HTML

SEP entries are formatted so that the footnotes are placed into a separate HTML file called “notes.html” and linked into the text. The file notes.html is placed into the same directory on plato.stanford.edu as the entry. If you are using an HTML-editor to create your entry, then you will need to use the functions provided by the editing software in order to create footnotes as links to a footnote file.

However, for those authors who are editing their HTML directly in order to create links from the text to the footnotes, here are some guidelines to follow. Suppose you want to add footnote number x at a point in the text:

...some text.^[x]

To produce this in your HTML sourcefile, use the following HTML code at the point in the text where the footnote should occur:

...some text.^{[<a href="notes.html#note-x" id="ref-x">x</a>]}

This will place “[x]” as a superscript in the text, with “x” a link to the place in the notes.html file identified as id="note-x" (see below). The id="ref-x" marks the spot in the current file to which a “Return” link from the notes.html file will return (again, see below). Then, create another HTML file named “notes.html” and in that file you will try to produce something that looks like this:

x. Body of the footnote goes here.…

To produce this line in the notes.html file, you would add the following HTML code:

<div id="note-x">
<p>
<a href="index.html#ref-x">x.</a> Body of the footnote goes here.…</p>
</div>

This will start a new paragraph and start the footnote with the symbol “x.” (“x.” will be a link back to id="note-x" in the main index.html file; the id="note-x" identifies the place in the notes.html file to which the footnote in the main text will be linked). Note: Users of the Encyclopedia can always use the “Back” or “Return” button on their browsers to get back to the text.