Supplement to Analysis
Ancient Conceptions of Analysis
- 1. Introduction
- 2. Ancient Greek Geometry
- 3. Plato
- 4. Aristotle
- 5. Ancient Chinese Philosophy
- 6. Ancient Indian Philosophy
- 7. Conclusion
1. Introduction
This supplement provides an outline of the conceptions of analysis involved in ancient Greek geometry and Plato’s and Aristotle’s philosophies, together with a comparison with analytic conceptions and methodologies in ancient Chinese philosophy and ancient Indian philosophy. The aim is not to explore in any detail the intricate conceptual, textual, and historical interrelationships but simply to highlight the key features of the relevant methodologies. Central to ancient methodologies is the regressive conception of analysis, as outlined in §2 of the main document. But there are also interesting comparisons to be drawn, such as between Plato’s method of division and the use of whole-part analysis in ancient Chinese philosophy, and between Aristotle’s syllogistic theory and ancient Indian logic.
2. Ancient Greek Geometry
Immediately after his characterization of the method of analysis and synthesis in his Mathematical Collection (as quoted in §2 of the main document), Pappus goes on:
Now analysis is of two kinds. One seeks the truth, being called theoretical. The other serves to carry out what was desired to do, and this is called problematical. In the theoretical kind we suppose the thing sought as being and as being true, and then we pass through its concomitants (akolouthôn) in order, as though they were true and existent by hypothesis, to something admitted; then, if that which is admitted be true, the thing sought is true, too, and the proof will be the reverse of analysis. But if we come upon something false to admit, the thing sought will be false, too. In the problematic kind we suppose the desired thing to be known, and then we pass through its concomitants (akolouthôn) in order, as though they were true, up to something admitted. If the thing admitted is possible or can be done, that is, if it is what the mathematicians call given, the desired thing will also be possible. The proof will again be the reverse of analysis. But if we come upon something impossible to admit, the problem will also be impossible. {Full Quotation}
According to Pappus, then, a distinction should be drawn between theoretical and problematical analysis, depending on whether we are seeking to demonstrate a theorem (such as Pythagoras’s theorem) or to carry out a construction (such as constructing an equilateral triangle on a given line). This distinction was also stressed by the last of the great classical Greek philosophers, the Neoplatonist Proclus, who wrote a commentary on the first Book of Euclid’s Elements in the fifth century {Quotations}. Geometry, Proclus remarks, “is divided into the working out of problems and the discovery of theorems. It calls ‘problems’ those propositions whose aim is to produce, bring into view, or construct what in a sense does not exist, and ‘theorems’ those whose purpose is to see, identify, and demonstrate the existence or nonexistence of an attribute.” (CEE, 157; cf. 63.) Although Euclid’s ‘Propositions’ do divide into theorems and problems, however, these are complementary, since, for every construction we carry out fulfilling the required conditions, there is a corresponding theorem to be proved demonstrating that the construction has the desired properties, and for every theorem, there will be some associated construction to be made. Pythagoras’s theorem, for example, might be put in ‘problematic’ form thus: “To construct three squares, one on each side of a triangle, such that the square on the longer side is equal to the other two squares.” The analysis required to solve this problem will at the same time provide the material to demonstrate Pythagoras’s theorem itself.
What analysis involves is the finding of appropriate principles, previously proved theorems, and constructional moves by means of which the problem can be solved (the desired figure constructed or the relevant theorem proved). Within Euclidean geometry, the constructional moves must be in accord with the first three postulates (drawing a line between any two points, extending a line and drawing a circle with any given center and radius). Working back to principles (axioms) and previously proved theorems suggests that the regressive conception of analysis reflected in Pappus’s account is indeed central. But it is not the only conception involved in ancient Greek geometrical analysis. The main aim in identifying appropriate principles and previously proved theorems is to reduce the problem set to a number of simpler problems which either have already been solved or can more easily be solved, so that transformation (interpretive analysis) and resolution (decompositional analysis) are also involved. That analysis includes both transformation and resolution has been noted by a number of commentators (see esp. Hankel 1874, 137–50; Heath E, I, 140–2).
The most important feature of ancient Greek geometrical analysis concerns the role played by the construction of figures, and in particular, by the construction of auxiliary lines—lines that are not strictly part of the figures that are mentioned in the specification of the problem but which are essential in arriving at those figures or proving the relevant theorem. Not only does this suggest that analysis is more creative than is usually supposed today (inspiration may be required in coming up with appropriate auxiliary lines), but it also makes the examination of the interrelationships between the various elements of the constructions a crucial part of analysis. This aspect has been stressed by Hintikka and Remes in their classic study of the method of analysis in ancient Greek geometry (1974). Hintikka and Remes distinguish between directional and configurational analysis, corresponding, respectively, to the regressive and decompositional conceptions outlined in the main document (§1.1), and argue that the latter is of far greater importance than the former. This may be overcompensating for the one-sidedness of the ‘directional’ interpretation, but there is no doubt that configurational analysis does play an essential role. Indeed, we may suggest that configurational analysis, fully understood, involves connective as well as decompositional analysis, since the aim is to understand how to get from one construction to another using the three postulates. Although there is continuing debate as to the nature of analysis in ancient Greek geometry, it is certainly more complex than suggested by Pappus’s classic account. (See especially Knorr 1993, Behboud 1994, Netz 2000.)
A further issue raised by Pappus’s text concerns the problem of reversibility. If we translate the term ‘akolouthôn’ by ‘consequences’, as Heath, for example, does (E, I, 138–9), then it looks as if Pappus conceives analysis and synthesis as deductively symmetrical. We assume ‘what is sought’ and follow through its consequences until we reach something accepted as true, when we reverse the process and derive the consequences of what we reached, in demonstrating the truth of what we sought. But this raises an obvious objection. For if Q is a consequence of P, it does not necessarily follow that P is a consequence of Q; so that deriving the consequences of ‘what is sought’ will not necessarily yield principles that can then be used to prove it. There is normally no backward road from consequents to antecedents.
There are two responses to this. One is to deny that ‘akolouthôn’ is to be understood as ‘consequences’ (in the logical sense) and to interpret it as something more like ‘concomitants’—in the weaker sense of ‘things that go together with one another’. Hintikka and Remes have powerfully argued for this interpretation, pointing out, for example, that Pappus seems to distinguish between ‘akolouthôn’ (‘concomitants’) and ‘epomena’, which does appear to mean ‘consequents’ here (1974, ch. 2; 89–91). The other response is to accept the understanding of ‘akolouthôn’ as ‘consequences’, but to then insist on the reversibility of all the steps (i.e., that what we typically have here are equivalences and not just implications), pointing out that this is precisely why synthesis is also needed, to show that the steps are reversible. These two responses are not necessarily in conflict, however. ‘akolouthôn’ may mean ‘concomitants’ rather than ‘consequences’, but investigating consequences may be one way of finding concomitants that can then be used in a rigorous synthesis. The issue of reversibility was to be a major theme in the history of the regressive conception of analysis.
3. Plato
If one root of modern conceptions of analysis in European philosophy lies in ancient Greek geometry, the other main root lies in the elenctic method followed by the Socrates of Plato’s early dialogues. The term ‘elenctic’ derives from the Greek word ‘elenchein’, meaning to cross-examine or refute, and Socrates’s method consists in asking questions of the form ‘What is F?’, where ‘F’ is typically the name of some virtue, and attempting to find a definition through dialogue with his interlocutors. For example, the question in the Charmides is ‘What is temperance [sôphrosunê]?’, in the Laches ‘What is courage [andreia]?’, in the Euthyphro ‘What is piety [hosiotês]?’, and in the Meno ‘What is virtue [aretê]?’ On the whole, commentators agree that what Socrates is seeking are real rather than nominal definitions, definitions that specify the essential nature of the thing concerned rather than the properties by means of which we can recognise it or the meaning of the term used to designate it. But there has been more controversy over precisely what the presuppositions of the elenctic method are, and how to respond, in particular, to the charge that Socrates commits the so-called Socratic fallacy. Socrates appears to be committed to the principle that if one does not know what the F is, then one cannot know if F is truly predicable of anything whatever, in which case it seems pointless to try to discover what the F is by investigating examples of it via the elenctic method.
Plato can be seen as facing up to this charge in the Meno, the dialogue that marks the transition from his early to his later work. If Socratic definition anticipates conceptual analysis, then the paradox that is formulated in this dialogue—Meno’s paradox—anticipates the paradox of analysis. Either we know what something is, or we do not. If we do, then there is no point searching for it. If we do not, then we will not know what to search for. (Cf. Meno, 80d–e.) It is in response to this paradox that Plato introduces his theory of recollection, about which there has been enormous controversy, and his conception of knowledge as true belief plus an account. But what is of greatest significance in this dialogue, as far as analysis is concerned, is Socrates’s famous interrogation of the slave-boy. For it is here that he discusses a geometrical problem, and shows the emerging influence of Greek geometry.
The influence of Greek geometry, and of the method of analysis, in particular, is evident in Plato’s introduction of the method of hypothesis, described and applied in the Meno (86e–87b), and discussed further in the Phaedo (100a–101d). Just as in geometrical analysis, the idea is to ‘hypothesize’ some supposedly prior proposition (e.g. that virtue is knowledge) by means of which the proposition under consideration (e.g. that virtue comes from teaching) can be demonstrated. As in the case of geometrical analysis, there has been a great deal of controversy over what the relationships are supposed to be between the various elements involved here, and there are also important differences between geometrical analysis and the method of hypothesis. But it does seem that interpreting the method of hypothesis against the background of ancient Greek geometry is the right approach (see esp. Sayre 1969, Mueller 1992).
In the later dialogues, Plato both refines his conception of knowledge as true belief plus an account (in the Theaetetus) and develops the method of hypothesis into the method of collection and division (in the Phaedrus, Sophist, Politicus and Philebus). The latter method involves, paradigmatically (but not exclusively), ‘collecting’ things generically and then ‘dividing’ them by a series of dichotomies into species. This is Plato’s mature method, in which we can see the method of analysis adapted to provide a metaphysical framework for his Socratic concern with definition. Although many have criticised the method of division, most notably, Ryle (1966), who wished to distinguish it from genuine philosophy or dialectic, it does seem that, properly understood, it forms the heart of Plato’s later methodology. Its importance lies not just in the resulting classificatory trees but in the structural relationships they reveal and the insights it encourages into the formal concepts involved (cf. Ackrill 1970).
4. Aristotle
Plato was, without doubt, the major influence on Aristotle, who was trained in Plato’s Academy. But Aristotle was not uncritical of Plato’s methodology. He criticises the method of division, for example, in Parts of Animals (I, 2–3). Like Plato, though, he was inspired by ancient Greek geometry. There are three passages in which Aristotle directly refers to geometrical analysis. The most famous passage occurs in the Nicomachean Ethics (III, 3), in which Aristotle compares reasoning about the means to a given end to analysis in geometry {Quotation}. Just as in geometrical analysis (see §2 of the main document), we work back from what is sought to something we already know how to construct or prove, so too in practical deliberation, according to Aristotle, we work back from what we want to something which we know how to do, which results in what we want. The second passage occurs in section 16 of On Sophistical Refutations, where Aristotle considers the question of how we can learn to diagnose bad arguments {Quotation}. Although the passage is not easy to interpret, his main point seems to be to emphasize that analysis must be supplemented by synthesis to yield a full solution of anything. The third passage occurs in the Posterior Analytics (I, 12), in which Aristotle recognises the problem of reversibility mentioned at the end of §2 above {Quotation}.
It is in relation to Aristotle’s development of syllogistic theory, expounded in the aptly named Analytics, however, that there are the most striking similarities. Just as the aim of the geometer is to solve geometrical problems (construct figures or prove theorems), so too Aristotle was concerned to solve logical problems (construct arguments or prove propositions). The Prior Analytics provides the framework to do this in the same way that Euclid’s Elements provided the framework in the case of geometry. And even more than in the case of geometry, analysis in Aristotle’s Analytics involves not just the regression to first principles, but also the entire process of elaborating the structural relations between the various elements of arguments and showing how one argument can be ‘reduced’ to another. Arguments are ‘analysed’ to the extent that they can be set out as ‘syllogisms’, each syllogism being a combination of two premises and a conclusion taking one of the specified forms of valid inference. Here is the form of the syllogism traditionally called Barbara, in one version of it:
Every A is B, every B is C; therefore every A is C.
In both English and Greek, however, the use of the copula—as in ‘A is B’ in English or ‘A estin B’ in Greek—is ambiguous, so Aristotle introduced a more technical expression, ‘applies to’ (or ‘belongs to’), to make clear which is the subject and which is the predicate, and the relation involved. ‘Every A is B’ was thus formalized by Aristotle as ‘(The) B applies to [or belongs to] all A’ (‘to B tō A huparchei’). Barbara could then be expressed as follows:
C applies to all B, B applies to all A; therefore C applies to all A.
A further advantage of this notation is that it enables the validity of the inference to be perspicuously exhibited, given the transitivity of the relation ‘applies to’ (as Aristotle understood it). (See Beaney 1996, pp. 21–2.) So as well as regressive and decompositional analysis, we have interpretive analysis illustrated in Aristotle’s logic. Sentences often need to undergo some kind of regimentation or ‘translation’ in developing a logical theory in order to make clear their logical character or role.
Just as it is in Euclidean geometry, however, the regressive conception of analysis is the most evident in Aristotelian logic. The main aim of the Analytics was to enable us to work back from a given proposition, assumed as conclusion, to premises by means of which that proposition can then be derived, and this was seen as facilitated by a thorough training in the whole syllogistic system. (For detailed discussion of the richness of Aristotle’s conception of analysis and the influence of ancient Greek geometry, see Byrne 1997.)
While the Prior Analytics is concerned with the theory of the syllogism in general, the Posterior Analytics is concerned with one particular type of syllogism, the demonstrative or scientific syllogism. A demonstrative syllogism is “one in virtue of which, by having it, we understand something” (71b17–19), that is, one in which the premises are “true and primitive and immediate and more familiar than and prior to and explanatory of the conclusion” (71b21–2). Aristotle distinguishes between understanding ‘the fact’ (to hoti) and understanding ‘the reason why’ (to dioti). He gives the example of the following two syllogisms (I, 13):
First Syllogism The planets do not twinkle What does not twinkle is near The planets are near
Second Syllogism The planets are near What is near does not twinkle The planets do not twinkle
Both are valid arguments, but whilst the first merely ‘gives the fact’, the second ‘gives the reason why’, that is, the second provides an explanation of what is stated in the conclusion in terms of the more basic facts expressed by the premises. That the planets do not twinkle is hardly an explanation of why they are near; but that they are near, according to Aristotle, is (part of) an explanation of why they do not twinkle (78a23–b3).
This distinction, and indeed the model of explanation involved here, was to play a crucial role in subsequent conceptions of analysis. For causal explanation itself became identified with logical deduction, and the movement from cause to effect was represented as the passage from premises to conclusion in a logical argument, and the finding of the cause of something as a matter of determining appropriate premises—something which could itself be done in a logical argument. On this conception, then, there could be a logic of discovery as well as a logic of proof. In the first case above, we start with an effect (the planets not twinkling) and determine its cause (the planets being near) by finding an appropriate additional premise, and in the second case, having determined the cause, we reverse the process to display the passage from cause to effect. The first was understood as analysis, providing a method of discovery, and the second as synthesis, providing a method of proof. Such a conception presupposes that the steps are reversible (i.e., in this case, the convertibility of ‘What does not twinkle is near’ and ‘What is near does not twinkle’), but with this assumption, there is a nice symmetry between analysis and synthesis. This conception of analysis and synthesis was to take center stage in the European Renaissance and early modern period.
For more on the Analytics, see the entry on Aristotle’s Logic. For an account of ancient Greek and Latin logic, more generally, see the entry on Ancient Logic.
5. Ancient Chinese Philosophy
Given the origin of ‘analysis’, as a methodological term, in ancient Greek geometry, and the philosophical development of the ideas of definition and regressive analysis in the work of Plato and Aristotle, especially, it might be thought that it is only in ancient Greek philosophy that we should seek to understand the origins of analytic methodology. In fact, however, it is worth comparing ancient Greek philosophy with other ancient traditions of philosophy, and most instructively, with ancient Chinese and ancient Indian philosophy. We focus here on Chinese philosophy and in the next section on Indian philosophy.
Confucianism and Daoism are generally seen as the two main traditions of ancient (pre-imperial) Chinese philosophy, but in recent years there has been growing appreciation of what might be called (if somewhat tendentiously) an analytic tradition (see e.g. Hansen 1992, ch.7; Beaney 2021). This is represented in the work of the Mohists and of the School of Names (see Fraser 2020c and 2023, respectively). In Mohism one finds for the first time explicit argumentation, and in later Mohism—in the Mohist Canons—concern with formulating definitions and explaining them (see Indraccolo 2020; Fraser 2020c; Lucas 2020). In the School of Names, especially in Hui Shi’s ten theses and Gongsun Long’s white horse discourse, we find the formulation of paradoxes, showing interest in the problems that our use of language and reasoning can generate (see Fraser 2020e).
At the core of Mohist philosophy of language and logic are the notions of biàn (辯) and tóng (同). biàn is used as either a verb meaning ‘distinguish’ or ‘discriminate’ or a noun meaning ‘distinction’ or ‘discrimination’, and in an extended sense refers to debate or argument that results in (correct) distinctions or discriminations. We are able to biàn if we can distinguish horses from non-horses, for example, and we can bring someone to do this in a new or disputed case by showing how it is the same or different to an agreed case of something’s being a horse. The Chinese term for ‘same’ here is tóng, and the Mohists distinguished a number of different senses of tóng, which to some extent line up with senses of the copula (using the verb ‘to be’) in European languages: identity, predication, constitution, and whole-part inclusion (see Fraser 2013).
It is sometimes suggested that while Western philosophy typically involves ‘bottom-up’ ontologies, Chinese philosophy involves ‘top-down’ ontologies. This is reflected in one of the standard ways of making existence claims. To say, for example, that there is a horse in the room is to say that the room has a horse. Existence is not construed as a property of an object, but as a relation between part and whole. To exist is to be part of something, and ultimately of the world. If we can talk of ‘analysis’ here, then it is whole–part analysis rather than decomposition into discrete entities (such as objects and properties). (See Graham 1989, Appendix 2.)
According to the Mohists, ‘distinguishing’ involves sorting into ‘kinds’ (lèi 類), and their account of lèi was part of a more general account of names, which might be fruitfully compared with Plato’s method of collection and division. One key difference is that appeal to similarity relations rather than generic and specific ‘forms’ (essences) lay at the base of their view. ‘Knowing kinds’ (zhī lèi 知類) was also fundamental in their account of reasoning, in moving from what is known to what is initially unknown (see Fraser 2020c; Yang and Zhang 2020).
In the work of the later Mohists, we can also find a regressive conception of analysis. Something is an F, on their view, if it is the same as (or sufficiently like) a relevant standard (fǎ 法). So explaining or justifying a claim consists in identifying the relevant standard. Reasoning itself consists in finding some agreed example of a valid or invalid inference, on the basis of which to persuade someone of the validity or invalidity of an inference not yet accepted or in dispute. The clearest account of Mohist logic can be found in chapter 45 of the Mòzǐ, called the ‘Lesser Selection’. Here is the key passage:
Analogy [pì [譬] is mentioning other things and using them to clarify it. ‘Paralleling’ [móu 侔] is placing expressions side by side and jointly proceeding. ‘Pulling’ [yuán 援] is saying, ‘You are so, how is it that I alone cannot be so?’ ‘Pushing’ [tuī 推] is, on this basis that what they don’t accept is the same as what they do accept, proposing it. (Mòzǐ, 45.1; tr. in Fraser 2020a)
According to the Mohists, then, reasoning consists in ‘going back’ to something that is agreed by the relevant disputants and then proceeding by analogy, which we can see as involving ‘paralleling’, ‘pulling’ and/or ‘pushing’, to establish the desired claim (for details, see Beaney 2021, §2.2; Fraser 2020c, §7.2; Yang 2020). The Mohists were aware that such analogical reasoning could be good or bad, which they illustrated by giving examples, but they developed no theory—in anything like the way Aristotle did—to offer any deeper analysis of such reasoning. In seeking to identify relevant examples and standards by which to guide reasoning, however, we can see an analytic methodology emerging.
In summary, then, there are points of connection between ancient Greek analytic methodologies and ancient Chinese methodologies, and the connections help throw light on both sets of methodologies. There is value in describing some of the Chinese methodologies and philosophies as ‘analytic’ to direct us to these connections, but it is important to understand them in detail to appreciate the deeper differences as well as surface similarities, and there is increasing scholarship to help us do just this. (Good places to start include the works by Fraser cited in §2.5 of the annotated bibliography and the chapters in Fung 2020; see also Harbsmeier 1998.)
For more detailed discussion, see the entries on Logic and Language in Early Chinese Philosophy, Mohism, and Mohist Canons.
6. Ancient Indian Philosophy
Among the earliest Indian philosophical texts are the Upaniṣads, the first of which date from around the seventh century BCE. These are commentaries on the earlier Vedic religious texts, disclosing Brahman as the source of life and key to liberation. The term ‘upaniṣad’ means ‘hidden connection’ or ‘secret teaching’ (Adamson and Ganeri 2020, p. 23), suggesting that the Upaniṣads were aimed at uncovering the hidden connections between things and expounding the teaching of the earlier Vedic texts. We might see here a form of connective analysis, and the idea that wisdom lies in seeing the connections between things is a theme throughout Indian philosophy, just as it is in Chinese philosophy. At the same time, in reporting public debates (pariṣad), the Upaniṣads show concern with finding reasons for beliefs, and arguments begin to be formulated for those beliefs. Here we can see regressive analysis emerging. In the Arthaśāstra (Treatise on Advantage), attributed to Kauṭilya (c. 370–283 BCE), one of the four branches of learning that are distinguished is ānvīkṣikī, which might be translated as ‘rational investigation’ or ‘investigation through reasoning’. This in turn was subdivided into sāmkhya, yoga, and lokāyata: listing and enumeration, dividing and reconnecting, and empirical experimentation (Adamson and Ganeri 2020, pp. 14–15). All forms of analysis can thus be seen as embryonic here.
Inevitably, the exposition of Vedic ideas provoked critical reaction. In the ancient period this came from Buddhism and Jainism, the two main heterodox schools, both originating in the sixth century BCE and both rejecting the authority of the Vedas and orthodox Hindu (Brahmanical) beliefs in a world creator, a hierarchical social structure, and rigid ritual practices. (Here there is a strong analogy with Daoist reactions to Confucianism in ancient China.) The ensuing debates fuelled the development of argumentation. One representative text is the Milinda-pañha (Questions of Milinda), in which a Buddhist sage called Nāgasena answers questions asked by King Melinda, who reigned from 155 to 130 BCE. Nāgasena explains to King Milinda how scholarly debate proceeds:
When scholars talk a matter over with one another, then is there a winding up, an unravelling [nibbeṭhanam], one or other is convicted of error, and he then acknowledges his mistake; distinctions are drawn, and contra-distinctions; and yet thereby they are not angered. [Quoted in Ganeri 2004, §1.1]
Here the use of ‘nibbeṭhanam’, which means ‘unravelling’ or ‘unwinding’ is revealing. It is comparable to the original meaning of the Greek term ‘analusis’, which also meant ‘unravelling’ or ‘loosening up’, suggesting that ‘nibbeṭhanam’ is the Indian counterpart of ‘analusis’. Certainly the idea of weaving and unweaving is a frequent trope in Indian philosophy as in other philosophical traditions, the distinction between unweaving and weaving corresponding to analysis and synthesis. The former pair of terms may now be seen as figurative in methodological discussions but the latter, in their current meaning, were woven from the former. (Perhaps ‘nibbethaning’ should be introduced into English as a synonym of ‘analysing’ to combat Eurocentrism.)
As far as the development of analytic methodology is concerned, however, the most significant difference between Greek and Indian philosophy is that while Greek (and European) methodology was rooted in Euclid’s geometry, Indian methodology was rooted in Pāṇini’s grammar, presented in the Aṣṭādhyāyī (Book in Eight Chapters), dating from the fifth century BCE. Building on the work of earlier grammarians (just as Euclid did on earlier mathematicians), Pāṇini here offers a systematic account of the grammar of Sanskrit, the sacred language of the Vedic religious texts. An analysis of its sounds is provided, together with formulation of rules or s ūtras, abstracting and generalizing linguistic formations, defining technical terms, and stating metarules specifying how the formation rules are to be applied. Just as Aristotle had invented schematic letters to stand for the terms in syllogisms, thereby elucidating logical form, so Pāṇini used abbreviations for grammatical constructions as well as in simplifying rules, thereby elucidating grammatical form. But while at the heart of Aristotle’s logic was the distinction between subject and predicate, at the core of Pāṇini’s grammar was the verb, taken as representing an action. Talk of actions brings into play what Pāṇini terms kārakas—all the things that play a role in the achievement of an action, most notably, agent, patient or recipient, instrument, locus, donor, and target. In ‘Devadatta cut the tree in the garden with an axe’, for example, Devadatta is the agent, the tree the patient, the garden the locus, and the axe the instrument. From this sentence other sentences can be derived, such as ‘The tree was cut with an axe’, the exact form in which these take in Sanskrit being governed by the rules of grammar, with case endings indicating the kārakas (instead of prepositions or word order as in English). (For discussion, see Cardona 1970, 1974; Matilal 2001, ch. 5.)
Pāṇini’s grammar inspired a whole commentarial tradition of its own, one of the most important texts being Patañjali’s Mahābhāṣya (c. 150 BCE). The linguistic analyses prompted questions about the semantics of the relevant terms, which gave rise to philosophical debates such as over the nature of universals and the meaning of empty terms (see the supplementary section on Indian Analytic Philosophy). Pāṇini’s grammar also marks the beginning of logic in India, with its formulation of both the law of excluded middle and the law of double negation. The key text of Indian logic in the ancient period, dating from the second century CE, is Gautama’s Nyāya-sūtra, the founding text of the Nyāya school, the school that specialized in logic and epistemology. (The term ‘nyāya’ means ‘rule’ or ‘method’, and hence, by extension, ‘logic’.) Here is the canonical example of the five-membered inference the Nyāya logicians formalized (see Perrett 2016, p. 79):
(1) Hypothesis (pratijñā): That mountain is fire-possessing.
(2) Reason (hetu): Because it is smoke-possessing.
(3) Corroboration (drṣṭānta): Whatever is smoke-possessing is fire-possessing, like kitchen, unlike lake.
(4) Application (upanaya): That mountain, since it possesses smoke, is fire-possessing.
(5) Conclusion (nigamana): Therefore that mountain is fire-possessing.
From the perspective of syllogistic theory, it would be easy to suggest that this inference could be simplified into the following form:
(1) Major premiss: Whatever is smoke-possessing is fire-possessing.
(2) Minor premiss: That mountain is smoke-possessing.
(3) Conclusion: That mountain is fire-possessing.
There is a crucial difference, however, between Aristotle and the Nyāya logicians. For the latter are not concerned with characterizing the logical form of an inference but with the epistemic process of inferring—just as the Sanskrit grammarian’s focus on the verb might suggest. In an actual argument—in convincing someone else that there is a fire on a mountain, say—one will identify one’s (observational) reason for claiming something and support it by giving at least one positive (sapakṣa) and one negative (vipakṣa) example. Inference (anumāna) was seen as one form of pramāna or means of knowledge, so Indian logic had an epistemic function, in making clear the role that inference plays in actual knowledge claims or acquisition. It was this interconnected concern with both logic and epistemology that set the agenda for subsequent Indian philosophy—especially for what can, with good reason, be called Indian analytic philosophy. (To follow its development, see the later sections on Medieval Indian Philosophy and Indian Analytic Philosophy.)
Anyone who engages with the Nyāya school of Indian philosophy, and their debates with the Buddhists, in particular, cannot fail to appreciate their ‘analytic’ concerns. As Western philosophers finally recognize the Eurocentrism of much of their thinking today, and gradually take steps to overcome it, Indian philosophy will begin to take its long overdue and rightful place in a broader history of analytic philosophy.
(For an excellent ‘analytic’ introduction to Indian philosophy, see Perrett 2015, which has chapters on knowledge, reasoning, and philosophy of language. For an introduction to Indian logic, see Matilal 1998a, and for a more detailed account, see Ganeri 2004 and the papers collected in Ganeri 2001a (which includes Matilal 1998a), and the entry on Logic in Classical Indian Philosophy.)
7. Conclusion
The term ‘analysis’ derives from the ancient Greek term ‘analusis’, which originally meant ‘unravelling’. Interesting, this ‘metaphor’ of unravelling also occurs in methodological discussions in other cultures, such as in the use of ‘nibbeṭhanam’ in Indian philosophy. So in exploring analytic methodology, we need to cast our linguistic net wider than simply to pick up ‘analusis’ in Greek and their transliterations in other (European) languages. To know which words to pick up we need to identify methodologies that are similar, in relevant respects, to those that are explicitly characterized as ‘analytic’ by their practitioners—though we can also be helped in this by seeing how they are described by later commentators, who may use ‘analytic’ and related terms themselves. This opens the door to a more inclusive account of analytic philosophy.
Common to the three main ancient philosophical traditions considered in this supplement is the role played by regressive analysis, broadly understood as the search for reasons by which something can be explained or justified. But decompositional, interpretive, and connective analysis are also involved in actual examples of analytic methodologies.
While a wide variety of methodologies can be described as ‘analytic’, the differences between them are also revealing. As we have seen, a fundamental difference between Greek (European) philosophy and Indian philosophy is their methodological roots in ancient Greek geometry and Sanskrit grammar, respectively—in other words, in geometrical analysis and linguistic analysis. We will see this playing out in their subsequent histories.
In his paper on ‘Euclid and Pāṇini’, J. F. Staal wrote that “Philosophers obtain passports for non-Aristotelian worlds as soon as they begin to study the syntax of a language which is sufficiently different from Greek” (1965, p. 7). {Full Quotation} (Classical) Chinese and Sanskrit are two languages that are indeed sufficiently different to permit us access to richer worlds of analysis. Staal went on to write: “Just as Plato reserved admission to his Academy for geometricians, Indian scholars and philosophers are expected to have first undergone a training in scientific linguistics. In India, grammar was called the Veda of the Vedas, the science of sciences. Renou declares: ‘To adhere to Indian thought means first of all to think like a grammarian’ ... This has determined the form and method of a large part of Indian philosophy” (1965, p. 16). {Full quotation} To adhere to Chinese thought, we might add, means to be thoroughly immersed in the classical Chinese texts. But engaging with Chinese philosophy also involves its own forms of analysis—hermeneutic, connective forms of analysis, rooted in the very different nature of the Chinese language, as we will see in the sections on later Chinese philosophy.