Medieval and Renaissance Conceptions of Analysis

• 1. Introduction
• 2. Medieval Indian Philosophy
• 3. Medieval Chinese Philosophy
• 4. Arabic and Islamic Philosophy
• 5. Medieval European Philosophy
• 6. European Renaissance Philosophy
• 7. Conclusion

1. Introduction

While standard courses on the history of European philosophy tend to leave out medieval philosophy in jumping from the ancient Greek to the early modern period, it is quite different in the case of other philosophical traditions—most notably, Indian, Chinese, and Arabic/Islamic philosophy. Here there are significant developments, so this supplementary document will begin with these. Aristotle’s syllogistic logic is one of the paradigms of analytic methodology in the history of philosophy, not only in being elaborated and discussed in the centuries that followed but also in providing a comparison by means of which to understand analytic methodology in other philosophical traditions. There are many other forms of analysis and different analytic concerns in the medieval and renaissance period, however, so the aim here is also to give a sense of some of these.

2. Medieval Indian Philosophy

There is no distinction between ‘ancient’ and ‘medieval’ Indian philosophy in anything like the way there is in European philosophy. Indeed, some talk instead of a ‘classical’ period, from roughly 200 CE to 1300 CE (see e.g. Perrett 2016, p. 7), which either falls between ‘ancient’ and ‘medieval’ periods or, in being extended further, includes the late medieval period as well, up to 1500 CE or so. In the supplementary section on Ancient Indian Philosophy two of the founding texts of Indian logic were discussed, Pāṇini’s Aṣṭādhyāyī, from the fifth century BCE, and Gautama’s Nyāya-sūtra, from the second century CE. These texts prompted intense debate about the nature of inference between all the various schools of Indian philosophy, but especially between the Nyāya school and the Buddhists, who had also begun to develop an interest in logic. The Buddhists include Dignāga (c. 480–540 CE) and Dharmakīrti (c. late 6th/early 7th century CE). Picking up here on the canonical five-membered inference that the Nyāya logicians had formulated, the simpler Buddhist version will be briefly explained, with discussion of some of the later debates left to the supplementary section on Indian Analytic Philosophy, concerned with the Navya-Nyāya or new Nyāya school, founded by Gaṅgeśa in the early 14th century.

The Buddhist inference-schema

Here is the simpler, three-membered inference that the Buddhists took as canonical, using the standard example of the mountain (with its standard schematized form in parentheses afterwards):

(1) Thesis (pakṣa): That mountain is fire-possessing. (p has s)

(2) Reason (hetu): That mountain is smoke-possessing. (p has h)

(3) Pervasion (vyāpti): Whatever is smoke-possessing is fire-possessing. (Whatever has h has s)

In arguing for this simpler form, Dignāga distinguished between inference for oneself (svārthānumāna), which takes the simpler form, and inference for others (parārthānumāna), which may need to be spelt out as if one were engaging in an actual argument with someone. What analysis is provided, in other words, depends on who it is for, and this goes hand-in-hand with a different conception of ‘inference’.

This simpler form of the inference looks similar to the corresponding (Aristotelian) syllogism, but with the conclusion stated first, the minor premiss second and the major premiss third. This similarity hides important differences, however, which come out when we understand what is meant by the key terms. The pakṣa (p) is the subject, the sādhya (s) is the property that qualifies the pakṣa, and the hetu is the property that also qualifies the pakṣa and provides the reason for the inference in being related by vyāpti—pervasion—to the sādhya. Let us begin with the pakṣa. What exactly is the ‘subject’? Scholars have suggested that this should be understood as the ground or locus of an inference, reflecting the Indian view that objects are never regarded in isolation but only as occurring in a locus. An inference, then, is not merely a relationship between two objects but one between two objects as occurring in a locus. Its basic form is not ‘h → s’ but ‘A(h, p) → A(s, p)’, read as ‘If h occurs in p, then s occurs in p’. One of the tasks of later Indian logic was then to see how far such inferences could be generalized to other loci. (See Staal 1973.)

Clearly, the key to this issue, and to the analysis itself, is the relation of pervasion, and this was also hotly debated in the subsequent commentaries. But if this account is right, then we can see how Indian analysis yields a rather different set of relations than those that Aristotelian analysis yields. For central to the Aristotelian syllogism is the relation ‘applies [or belongs] to’, as in ‘(The) B applies to all A’ (‘to B tō A huparchei’), as Aristotle formulated—i.e., regimented—‘A is B’ (‘A estin B’). The basic syllogism Barbara could then be expressed as follows (see the supplementary section on Aristotle):

C applies to all B, B applies to all A; therefore C applies to all A.

There is thus only one fundamental relation. In Indian logic, by contrast, there are two fundamental relations, the relation of occurrence and the relation of pervasion. This complicated the analysis of the Indian inference-form, in finding the best way to express and explain the relations. (See the supplementary section on Indian Analytic Philosophy.)

Aristotle’s treatment of syllogistic inference is one of the models of analysis. There are clear similarities to the Indian—whether Nyāya or Buddhist—treatment of the inference-pattern that they identified as basic. A canonical form is identified, language is regimented to formulate succinctly the various elements (thesis, reason, etc.), and rules and definitions are offered to explain the key concepts and operations. All the aspects of analysis distinguished in §1.1 are here exemplified: regression to the fundamental forms and principles, decomposition into the significant parts of the sentences, ‘translation’ into a more privileged language, with the aim being to see how everything connects, not least as part of the broader epistemological project of explaining the sources of knowledge (pramāṇas), of which inference (anumāna) was one of the main ones. (For further discussion, see Ganeri 2001a, and especially Staal 1973 and Matilal 1998, contained in Ganeri 2001a. See also the entry on Logic in Classical Indian Philosophy.)

Dharmakīrti’s analysis of the semantics of the Sanskrit particle eva

Dharmakīrti is one of the most important of the Buddhist logicians who contributed to the development of debate about knowledge and inference in India. His major work was the Pramāṇavārttika (Commentary on Epistemology), so-named because it was a commentary on Dignāga’s Pramāṇasamuccaya (Compendium of Epistemology). Let us take just one example from this work to illustrate the way that logical analysis was rooted in Sanskrit grammar, in this case concerning the semantics of the particle eva, which can mean ‘only’, ‘alone’, ‘exactly’, ‘indeed’, or ‘just’, depending on the context. Whether there is a unified meaning here is exactly the issue. Consider the following two sentences (as discussed in Ganeri 2011, 237–40):

(1) (Pārtha eva) dhanurdharah. [Pārtha alone is an archer.]

(2) Caitro (dhanurdhara eva). [Caitra is an archer indeed.]

These are analysed by Dharmakīrti as follows:

(1*) Being-an-archer is excluded from connection with other than Pārtha.

(2*) Being-an-archer is excluded from non-connection with Caitra.

On Dharmakīrti’s view, the particle eva is a device of quantification, effecting some kind of restriction on the relation between subject and predicate depending on its position in the sentence. Dharmakīrti explains its meaning as ‘exclusion’, which takes one of two basic kinds, exclusion from connection with something else (anyayoga-vyavaccheda) and exclusion from non-connection (ayoga-vyavaccheda). (The latter is further divided into two, but unlike Dignāga, Dharmakīrti does not regard this as semantically relevant.) The particle operates on either the subject or predicate term. In the first case it functions analogously to ‘only’ in English. To say that only Pārtha (Pārtha alone) is an archer is to say that, in a certain domain of people, being an archer is restricted to just one person, i.e., that all others are excluded. In the second case, it seems to function rather differently, as captured by the use of ‘indeed’ in translating it. But Dharmakīrti also treats eva here as meaning ‘exclusion’. To say that Caitra is an archer eva is to say that, in the domain of archers, Caitra is (emphatically) within it, i.e., to exclude the case of Caitra not being an archer. Dharmakīrti’s analysis was controversial, though, and was criticized by later logicians, especially in the Navya-Nyāya school. But it is revealing in the way that it aimed to provide a unified account of the Sanskrit particle eva, a particle that, so it seems, is impossible to translate by a single term in English that captures all its main uses. (Could we do so, for example, in the pair of sentences ‘Men exclusively are archers’ and ‘Men are archers exclusively’?) Dharmakīrti’s logical analysis was motivated partly (but not only!) by concern to respect Sanskrit grammar. (For further discussion, see Ganeri 2011, ch. 16, on which the account just given draws. See also Gillon and Hayes 1982; Katsura 1986; Ganeri 1999. For more on Dharmakīrti, generally, see the entry on Dharmakīrti.)

3. Medieval Chinese Philosophy

After China was unified in 221 BCE, leading to the short-lived Qin dynasty (221–207 BCE) and then Han dynasty (206 BCE–220 CE), the nascent ‘analytic tradition’ identified in the supplementary section on Ancient Chinese Philosophy was suppressed, with the result that little further work was done on broadly logical topics until Buddhism entered China in the first century CE and increasingly gained influence during the warring Six Dynasties period (220–581). Translations into Chinese were made of key Buddhist texts, and some such texts have actually only survived in Chinese translation. The influence of the Nyāya school is manifest, and indeed the term ‘nyāya’, often interpreted as ‘logic’, was translated into Chinese as ‘yīn míng 因明’, which literally means ‘reason understanding’ or ‘getting clear about reasons’. This term is still used today to refer specifically to Buddhist logic. (On some of the issues involved in the translation of logic from Sanskrit to Chinese, see Harbsmeier 1998, 396–404.)

Fazang’s analysis of the relationship between whole and part

A key figure in Chinese Buddhism, and more specifically in that variant of Mahayana Buddhism called Huayang, was Fazang (643–712). His two most famous pieces are his ‘Essay on the Golden Lion’ and ‘The Rafter Dialogue’ (tr. in Tiwald and Van Norden 2014, §§ 14–15). In the first he uses the metaphor of a statue of a golden lion to explain the relationship between the ‘pattern’ (lǐ 理) that unifies and underlies everything (the gold of the statue) and the objects and events of our ordinary perception (the appearance of the statue as a lion) which are only illusory or ‘empty’, on the Buddhist view. {Quotation} In the second he uses the metaphor of a rafter forming part of a building to explain the relationship between parts and wholes. This relationship has six characteristics: wholeness (the identity of part and whole); particularity (the difference between part and whole); identity (the identity between the parts); difference (the difference between the parts); integration (the unity of the parts in the whole); disintegration (the separateness of the parts). {Quotation} The six characteristics may well seem inconsistent, but Fazang argues that they are all aspects of the relationship between part and whole. The characteristics of wholeness and identity, as characterized, might seem especially counterintuitive, but one of Fazang’s main concerns is to stress how everything is interdependent. A building couldn’t be what it is without its parts, and a rafter couldn’t be what it is without playing the role it does in the building combined with the other parts, so their ‘identities’ are not independent of one another. (For a proposed explication of these six characteristics, see Jones 2019.)

This clearly has implications for the idea of analysis. On the Buddhist view, we can decompose a whole into its parts, but we must not assume that the parts that successively result are somehow more real. Indeed, “in the final analysis there is only emptiness”, as Fung puts it (1953, 346), in the sense that nothing can exist in and by itself. Although we can conceive of the parts separately, this is only an idealization that ignores their dependence on each other and on the whole that integrates them. Here the image that is often used is that of Indra’s Net, a web of threads at every node of which lies a jewel, so clear and bright that every jewel reflects every other. Once again we find the metaphor of a web, and here it is interesting to connect it with the idea of ‘sliding scales of analysis’, as Dunne has called it in relation to Dharmakīrti’s philosophy (2004, 53–79). Westerhoff has elaborated this in explaining the idea of ‘graded teaching’ (anuśāsana) in Buddhist thought. He writes that “it is necessary to distinguish four levels of philosophical analysis in ascending order of sophistication” (2018, 253). The first level begins with the perspective of ordinary beings, the second level reduces selves and other phenomena to more fundamental (spatio-temporal) elements; the third level refines this view into a form of particularism, seeking to explain how we individuate into particulars; and the fourth level finally recognizes the ideality of everything. {Quotation} The driving force behind the movement through the four levels, Westerhoff comments, is a single argumentative pattern: the neither-one-nor-many argument. A whole seems to be both identical with its parts (as otherwise it would not exist) and different from its parts (since the whole is one and the parts many). In response, reductionism asserts only the reality of the parts, the apprehension of which particularism then seeks to explain. Yet, ultimately, we must recognize the ideality of all individuation. {Quotation} Whether there is such a sliding scale of analysis in Fazang’s thought, and whether he wants to assert that all is (ultimately to be seen as) illusory, is a matter of debate, but the claim that all is interdependent is clearly what he wants to argue for, and Indra’s Net is a powerful image to illustrate this. Analysis is required to start the process of understanding individuation, but the deeper goal is to appreciate the interdependence of what is individuated. This might be variously described as recognizing the limits of analysis, going beyond analysis, or appreciating how analysis and synthesis, properly conceived, are interdependent.

Zhu Xi’s conception of lǐ

What makes a whole more than the sum of its parts, on the Chinese view, is the ‘pattern’ or ‘principle’ (lǐ 理) that unifies it. This idea was to become central to Neo-Confucianism, which attempted to reconstruct ancient Confucianism in response to the criticisms made by Buddhism and Daoism, while retaining this core idea. What was rejected was the idea of ‘emptiness’. The greatest of the Neo-Confucians was Zhu Xi (1130–1200), who wrote detailed commentaries on the Confucian classics and established what was to remain the canon for the civil service examinations until the fall of the Qing dynasty in the early twentieth century. Zhu Xi emphasized not only ‘lǐ’ but also ‘qì’(氣), a term that is best left untranslated, meaning something like the psychophysical stuff out of which everything is made, the form of this stuff, or the vital energy or force that generates everything. Zhu Xi saw ‘lǐ’ and ‘qì’ as always co-present: qì condenses to create things, while lǐ is the pattern of complex interrelationships between things. Zhu Xi was mainly concerned with the human realm, and this is how he describes ‘lǐ’ and ‘qì’ here (with ‘lǐ’ translated by ‘Pattern’):

A person is created by the coming together of Pattern and qi. The Heavenly Pattern is inherently vast and inexhaustible. Nonetheless, were it not for the qi, there would be nowhere for this Pattern to adhere to. Hence, the yin and yang qi must interact, congealing and coming together, and only then can this Pattern have a place to affix itself. The ability of all people to speak, move, think, and act, is due to the qi. But filial piety, brotherly respect, conscientiousness, faithfulness, benevolence, righteousness, propriety, and wisdom are all manifestations of the Pattern. (Categorized Conversations, 65:12; tr. in Tiwald and Van Norden 2014, 172)

It would be tempting to see Zhu Xi as engaged in some form of regressive analysis, concerned to uncover the underlying pattern of human relationships so that those relationships could be properly regulated. Distinctions are indeed drawn between different virtues—as here, for example—and an attempt made to explain them in terms of more basic virtues such as benevolence (rén 仁) and righteousness (yì 義). But it would be better to see Zhu Xi’s approach as a form of connective analysis, one in which, for example, the different roles that people play are carefully specified and illustrated so that everyone knows where they all stand in the social and political hierarchy. He writes:

The myriad things all have the Pattern, and their Patterns all come from one source. However, the roles that they occupy are different, so the Functions of their Patterns are not one. As a ruler, one must be benevolent; as a minister, one must be reverent; as a child, one must be filial; as a father, one must be kind. Each thing fully has the Pattern. And though each thing is different in its Function, everything is a manifestation of the one Pattern. (Categorized Conversations, 398:9; tr. in Tiwald and Van Norden 2014, 173)

Ultimately, for Zhu Xi and the Neo-Confucians, in general, the aim of their teaching and writing was the harmonious functioning of society, in which everyone plays their allotted role. They may have disagreed on how it is—or should be—manifested, but they all shared the fundamental assumption that there was one single Pattern to be followed.

For more detailed discussion, see the entries on Chan Buddhism, Song-Ming Confucianism, and Zhu Xi. For a collection of readings, with helpful editorial material, see Tiwald and Van Norden 2014.

4. Arabic and Islamic Philosophy

Under the reign of the ‘Abbāsid dynasty, which overthrew the Ummayad caliphate in 750 CE, a great translation movement, centred in Baghdad, flourished. A vast number of Greek texts dealing with topics from philosophy, medicine, science, theology, etc., some of which had previously been translated into Syriac, appeared for the first time in Arabic. Schools—often comprised of Muslims, Jews, and Christians—studied these texts intensively and produced commentaries, companions, and entirely independent works. Of particular importance to the development of philosophy during this period were the texts of Aristotle and the Neoplatonists. Falsafa (a loan translation from the Greek philosophia), however, should not be understood as an isolated discipline. It intertwines and interacts with kalam (Islamic theology), jurisprudence, linguistics, physics, and more. Here we focus on just the reception of Aristotle’s syllogistic theory.

Analysis, syllogism and the topoi

As mentioned in the supplementary section on Aristotle, Aristotle, in Prior Analytics, employs a conception of analysis according to which an argument is analysed by being set out as a syllogism—a combination of two premises and a conclusion—that takes one of the specified valid figures. After pointing out that, when expressed “either in writing or in discussion” (PrA, I, 32, 47a15), arguments sometimes contain redundancies or lack necessary elements, Aristotle states that the process of analysing arguments involves inquiring “whether anything unnecessary has been assumed, or anything necessary has been omitted, and ... posit[ing] the one and tak[ing] away the other, until we have reached the two propositions [i.e., the premises]” (PrA, I, 32, 47a17–20).

Abū-ʿAlī al-Ḥusayn ibn-ʿAbdallāh Ibn Sīnā (Avicenna) (c. 970–1037), in Qiyās (“Syllogism”), which is a commentary on Aristotle’s Prior Analytics, and a book in his encyclopaedic al-Shifāʾ (The Cure), picks up on this conception of analysis and adds that for our analyses of arguments to be successful, “we need to have rules in the form of dos and don’ts” (QI, 9.6.2) that guide them. Diverging from a direct commentary on Prior Analytics, Ibn Sīnā then provides an extensive list of such rules. For instance, he tells us that if our aim is to prove the conclusion ‘Every C is an A’, and we have found to be true the premises ‘Every C is a B’ and ‘Every D is an A’, then, if ‘Every B is a D’ is clear and true, we can construct a syllogism that does this. If ‘Every B is a D’ is not clear or true, then, Ibn Sīnā writes, our syllogism “needs a middle”, i.e., further premises that connect the premises we have found to be true such that the inference to ‘Every C is an A’ can be made (QI, 9.6.6).

Aristotle’s conception of analysis as setting arguments out as syllogisms that take valid figures was also picked up and elaborated by Abū al-Walīd Muḥammad ibn Aḥmad Ibn Rushd (Averroes) (1126–98). Before explaining Ibn Rushd’s elaboration, it is necessary to first touch on Aristotle’s notion of a topos. In his treatise, Topics, on the various topoi, Aristotle does not offer a definition of the notion. Nevertheless, in Rhetoric he writes, “[b]y an element I mean the same thing as a topos; for an element is a topos embracing a large number of particular kinds of enthymeme” (R, III, 1403a18–19; tr. modified). Unpacking this, we can say that a topos is a general argument schema, under which many concrete enthymemes fall. It is by using a topos that we are able, from an enthymeme, to construct an argument that takes a valid figure (see the entry on Aristotle’s Rhetoric for further discussion).

In his al-Darūrī fī al-mantiq (“What is indispensable in logic”: Summary of Logic), Ibn Rushd explains that analysing arguments by setting them out as syllogisms that take valid forms involves our doing the following: We analyse (in the decompositional sense) a maṭlūb (‘objective’ or ‘quaesitum’—sometimes a maṭlūb takes the form of a two-way question, such as Is fever foreign hotness?) into its predicate and subject and review the topoi to discover whether the quaesitum falls under one of them, and if so, which. If we discover that quaesitum falls under a specific topos, then, Ibn Rushd claims, “we have there and then found the syllogism which allows us to establish or refute it” (SL, §6). Ibn Rushd gives an example of this action in his treatise on topoi. The quaesitum is that mentioned above: Is fever foreign hotness?, which Ibn Rushd analyses into its subject, fever, and predicate, foreign hotness. Fever, Ibn Rushd claims, divides into three species, “one-day fever, putrid fever, and hectic fever”, each of which belongs to the genus of foreign hotness (RT, §3). Accordingly, the topos Ibn Rushd claims subsumes the quaesitum, and leads to the discovery of the syllogism that (in this case) establishes its positive answer, is “any predicate found in all the species of a certain subject is found in all of the subject” (ibid.). The syllogism Ibn Rushd constructs from this topos is:

Fever is either hectic fever, one-day fever, or putrid fever.

Each of these is a foreign hotness.

_______________________________________________

Therefore: Every fever is a foreign hotness. (Ibid.)

In his discussion of the Aristotelian conception of analysis as setting arguments out as syllogisms that take valid forms, Ibn Rushd does something that Aristotle does not do. He offers an explanation for why the area of logic concerned with this process is called ‘analysis’. It is so called, according to Ibn Rushd, because the action of analysing, in the decompositional sense, a quaesitum into its subject and predicate is one of its essential components (SL, §6) {Quotation}.

(For more on these two philosophers, see the entries on Ibn Sīnā and Ibn Rushd.)

Analysis and the paradigm (tamthīl)

In commenting on Aristotle’s Prior Analytics 2, 24, Abū Naṣr Muḥammad al-Fārābī (c. 870–950) develops a novel conception of analysis as a way of inferring from the knowledge that some content A is true of something D, and that some other thing C is similar to D, to the conclusion that A is also true of C. The result here, as al-Fārābī puts it, is that the content A is transferred from D to C. The name al-Fārābī gives to inferring in this manner is the paradigm (tamthīl). He also notes that it is similar to a form of argumentation often used by Islamic theologians, known as ‘inference to the unobserved by means of the observed’ (SY, 5.22), since it is often the case that A is perceived by the senses to be true of D.

The way of performing the paradigm that al-Fārābī calls analysis works in the following manner {Quotation}. We start by determining which content we seek to transfer to our unobserved thing. To take al-Fārābī’s own example (SY, 19.2), let us say that the content is ‘created’, and our unobserved thing is ‘the sky’. (Clearly, when al-Fārābī says the sky is unobserved, he does not mean that we cannot perceive the sky at all, but rather that we cannot and have not perceived the sky in all its extent and duration; hence, we cannot perceive by the senses that ‘created’ is true of the sky.) Next, we look for sense-perceived things of which the content ‘created’ is true. Al-Fārābī gives the examples of animals and plants. We then take one of these things, say, an animal, and look for the concepts under which both it and the sky fall, i.e., the concepts that make these two things similar. Next, we search for a concept, B, among the concepts we found in the previous step, which is the concept in virtue of which the content ‘created’ is true of the animal. That is to say, we search for the concept B such that in virtue of the animal falling under B, ‘created’ is true of it. Indeed, it must be the case that ‘created’ is perceived to be true of all the things it is perceived to be true of in virtue of their falling under B. The concept al-Fārābī hits on is ‘attached to created things’ (SY, 19.2). This gives us the following major premise: Everything attached to created things is created. (It is worth noting that al-Fārābī claims (SY, 19.10) that this major premise can be verified by employing the topoi of Accepting (wujūd) and Rejecting (irtifāʾ) in a kind of conceptual analysis; for further discussion, see SY, 80–2.) From this, we can construct the following syllogism, which completes the transference of the content ‘created’ to the unobserved by means of the observed:

The sky is attached to created things.

Everything attached to created things is created.

_______________________________________

Therefore: The sky is created. (SY, 19.2)

(For more on this, see the entry on al-Farabi’s Philosophy of Logic and Language.

5. Medieval European Philosophy

In the supplementary document on Ancient Conceptions of Analysis, three particular sources of conceptions of analysis in ancient Greek thought were identified—ancient Greek geometry, Plato’s dialogues, and Aristotle’s Analytics. The interconnections between these alone are complex; but there were other influential conceptions in antiquity as well—most notably, Galen’s amalgam of previous methodologies in the context of medicine, and the Neoplatonists’ theological transformation of Plato’s method of division. Given this complexity, and the fragmentary nature of the material upon which writers in the medieval period drew, it is not surprising that making sense of medieval methodologies in Europe is an interpretive nightmare.

Aquinas and three notions of resolutio

The interpretive intricacies can be illustrated here by taking the case of Thomas Aquinas (c. 1225–74). In a paper published in 1994, Eileen Sweeney argued that there are three notions of resolutio—to use the Latin term that translated the original Greek word ‘analusis’—in Aquinas’s work. The first is resolution as a kind of division, understood as a process of decomposition, modelled on the movement down a classificatory tree in Plato’s method of division, whereby a genus is ‘broken down’ into its constituent species. The second is resolution as reversion (i.e., regression), in effect understood in opposition to the first, since it is modelled on the movement up a classificatory tree towards the higher Forms. (For more on the connection between these two conceptions, see §4 of the main document.) The third is resolution as problem-solving, understood as what is prior to the systematic act of demonstration (synthesis). The first derives from Plato, and more specifically, Sweeney suggests, Calcidius’s Commentary on the Timaeus, which also owes something to Aristotle. The second shows the influence of Neoplatonism, according to which all things are to be resolved into their principles and ultimately traced back to the One (God). The third (as shown in §2 of the main document) has its roots in ancient Greek geometry, again mediated through the works of Aristotle. If this account is right, then it suggests, at the very least, that there are certain tensions in Aquinas’s discussions of methodology, tensions that reflect the different traditions which he was attempting to bring together.

Buridan’s ‘On Demonstrations’

However, perhaps the richest and most interesting text for exploring conceptions of analysis in medieval philosophy is the Summulae de Dialectica (SD) of John Buridan (c. 1300–c. 1360). Ostensibly a commentary on Peter of Spain’s Tractatus or Summulae Logicales, it is in fact a systematic compendium of medieval logic, going considerably beyond Peter’s work, and amounting to some 1000 pages (in its first complete English translation of 2001). Comprising nine Treatises, the key Treatise for our purposes is the eighth, entitled ‘On Demonstrations’. Buridan here distinguishes between divisions, definitions and demonstrations, which can be seen as corresponding, respectively, to decompositional, interpretive, and regressive analysis, as characterized in §1 of the main document. The bulk of the Treatise (chs. 3–12) is concerned with demonstration, explaining and elaborating on Aristotle’s account in the Posterior Analytics (as outlined in the supplementary section on Aristotle). Central to this is Aristotle’s distinction between understanding ‘the fact’ and understanding ‘the reason why’—between demonstration quia and demonstration propter quid, in medieval terms (see esp. SD, Tr. 8, chs. 8–9). Here the regressive conception of analysis is dominant. Buridan talks, for example, of ‘simple’ demonstrations being ones that are not ‘analysable’ or ‘resolvable’ into prior demonstrations (SD, 8.5.2), and of demonstration quia as a ‘reversion’ from effect to cause (SD, 8.9.3). But the discussion of demonstration is prefaced by two chapters on division and definition, and here Plato’s influence is more manifest. Buridan characterises ‘division’ as the separation of a whole into its parts (SD, 8.1.2), and distinguishes various kinds of division, one kind being the division of a genus into its species, which was Plato’s method of division. His account of definition too has its roots in Plato’s work, and in particular, the elenctic method of Socrates (cf. the supplementary section on Plato). But it also draws on Aristotle’s work, and most significantly of all, anticipates the interpretive conception of analysis of both early modern Indian and twentieth-century European analytic philosophy.

Buridan’s treatment of definition would not look out of place in a modern textbook. He offers a succinct statement of criteria of adequacy, and draws a clear distinction between four types of definition—nominal, quidditative (i.e., real), causal and descriptive. The interpretive conception of analysis comes out in his account of nominal definition. Buridan writes that “A nominal definition [diffinitio explicans quid nominis] is an expression convertibly explaining what thing or things the definitum [i.e., the term defined] signifies or connotes, and properly speaking it is called ‘interpretation’”, adding that “here I take ‘interpretation’ for the explicit analysis [expositio] of the signification of a word or expression that is being interpreted”. The term ‘philosopher’, for example, is interpreted as ‘lover of wisdom’, and the sentence ‘Only man is risible’ as the conjunction ‘Man is risible, and nothing other than man is risible’. (SD, 8.2.3; cf. Tr. 6, ch. 3.) Further examples can be found in the ninth and final Treatise, entitled ‘Sophismata’, although here the term ‘interpretation’ is not itself used. In this Treatise, Buridan illustrates how interpretive analysis can be put to work in clarifying ‘sophismata’—sentences that are philosophically puzzling or instructive. He shows, for example, how ‘Some donkey every man sees’ is ambiguous, suggesting the two formulations ‘Some donkey every man sees’ and ‘Every man sees some donkey’ to bring out what we would now explain in terms of the different scope of the two quantifiers ‘some’ and ‘every’ (cf. SD, Tr. 9, ch. 3, seventh sophism and reply).

Syncategoremata, exponibilia and interpretive analysis

As used here, the quantifiers ‘only’, ‘some’ and ‘every’ are examples of what medieval logicians called ‘syncategorematic’ expressions (or uses of expressions)—expressions that signify nothing by themselves, but only when taken together with some other expression (in this case, ‘man’ or ‘donkey’). From the twelfth century onwards, there was much discussion of the logic of syncategoremata, and exposition (expositio), i.e., interpretive analysis, became one of the main tools of elucidation. From the middle of the fourteenth century, until the demise of medieval logic in the sixteenth century, exponibilia—exponible sentences, i.e., sentences requiring exposition—became a subject in itself for systematic treatment. Although its authorship is uncertain, the Tractatus exponibilium of 1489 is representative of such treatment. An exponible sentence is here defined in terms of syncategoremata: “An exponible proposition [propositio exponibilis] is a proposition that has an obscure sense requiring exposition in virtue of some syncategorema occurring either explicitly or included within some word.” (Tr. in Kretzmann 1982, 215.)

Kretzmann (1982) gives several examples of sophismata involving syncategoremata to illustrate the way in which their treatment developed in the later medieval period. One example involves the exceptive term ‘praeter’:

(S) Socrates twice sees every man except Plato. [Socrates bis videt omnem hominem praeter Platonem.]

This sentence too is ambiguous, depending on the scope of the syncategoremata ‘twice’ and ‘except’. The two interpretations might be represented as follows:

(S#) With the exception of Plato (Socrates twice sees every man).

(S*) Twice (Socrates sees every man except Plato).

The difference can be appreciated by considering the case in which, on one occasion, Socrates sees everyone including Plato, and on another occasion, sees everyone excluding Plato, i.e., where Socrates sees Plato once and everyone else twice. (S#) would then be true, but (S*) false. Various diagnoses of the ambiguity can be found in the literature on syncategoremata from the twelfth to the sixteenth centuries. The scope distinction is recognised, for example, by Bacon in his Sincategoreumata of the early thirteenth century (cf. Kretzmann 1982, 219). But the role of exposition is perhaps best illustrated in the Sophismata of Albert of Saxony, dating from the middle of the fourteenth century. In diagnosing the ambiguity, Albert recognises that (S) implies a simpler, equally ambiguous sentence, which we might formulate as follows:

(SP) Socrates did not twice see Plato.

Here is what he then says:

Now in “Socrates did not see Plato twice” the whole predicate [“did see Plato twice”] is denied of the whole subject; but in “Socrates twice did not see Plato” not the whole predicate but a part of it is denied of the subject, because the term “twice” remains affirmed. (Tr. in Kretzmann 1982, 223.)

Here we might represent the two interpretations as follows:

(SP#) Socrates did not (see Plato twice). [Socrates non videt bis Platonem.]

(SP*) Socrates twice (did not see Plato). [Socrates bis non videt Platonem.]

Here the ambiguity depends on the scope of ‘twice’ (‘bis’) and ‘not’ (‘non’), which Albert recognises in the way he formulates the two alternatives. Albert may not have been able to draw on the resources of modern quantificational logic to formalise the two interpretations, but he clearly has some understanding of the idea of scope.

The medieval literature on sophismata, syncategoremata and exponibilia, then, shows that interpretive analysis had an important role to play long before it became a central tool of (Indian and European) analytic philosophy. In modern analytic philosophy, interpretive analysis is used, in particular, in eliminativist or reductive projects—in minimizing our ontological commitments, or revealing what our underlying ontological commitments are (see the supplement on Conceptions of Analysis in Analytic Philosophy). But this too is anticipated in the medieval period—most notably, in the nominalist philosophies of Ockham and Buridan. Ockham is the originator of the principle now known as Ockham’s Razor, and Buridan is often seen as having practised what Ockham preached. (On Ockham’s nominalism, see the section on Metaphysics in the entry on William of Ockham, and on the similarities and differences between Ockham and Buridan, see the section on Language in the entry on John Buridan. Cf. also Klima 2001, xxvii f.) The combination of interpretive analysis and reductionism, in the context of the development of modern logic, may be what characterises one of the central strands in modern analytic philosophy, but the first two elements can also be found in medieval philosophy.

Annotated Bibliography, §3.5

6. European Renaissance Philosophy

During the Renaissance, with the rediscovery and translation of ancient Greek texts that had simply not been known in Christian Europe in medieval times, awareness gradually grew of the variety of methodologies in antiquity. This prompted widespread discussion of methodology, inspired by the very problem of how to deal with the ancient texts. Indeed, methodology itself became one of the hottest issues of all, as Renaissance thinkers fought to make sense of their great predecessors. Key figures in this debate are Petrus Ramus (1515–72) and Jacopo Zabarella (1533–89), who can be taken as representative of the two poles between which debate took place.

Ramus

Ramus was a savage critic of Aristotle, and proposed to replace the subtleties and complexities of Aristotelian logic with the single method of humanist dialectic, conceived as the means of systematizing knowledge to facilitate learning and its practical use. Ramus saw Aristotle’s Organon (or logical works) as a confused body of doctrine, which it was his task to reorganise for pedagogical purposes, based on the simple principle that the general comes before the specific, the whole before the part. Utilizing Plato’s method of dichotomous division, Ramist works became famous (or infamous) for their elaborate tables and tree diagrams. Although Ramus drew the familiar distinction between discovery and demonstration, or as he called it, invention and disposition, the latter was clearly of greater importance to him than the former. According to Ramus, the discoveries had already been made by the ancients; the task was only to present them properly. (Cf. Gilbert 1960, ch. 5.)

This suggests that Ramus rejected the need for analysis, as understood in the Aristotelian tradition. But this is obscured somewhat by the fact that he takes ‘analysis’ in a different sense. In logic, Ramus writes, “analysis is the marshaling (examen) of the argument, enunciation, syllogism, method, in short of the whole art of logic, as is prescribed in the First Book of the Analytics” (quoted by Ong 1958, 263). Something analogous holds in other fields. As Ong notes, “Analysis, for Ramus, is thus at root a way of operating didactically upon a text. It belongs not to an art, but to usus or exercise” (1958, 264). It was complemented by genesis, rather than ‘synthesis’ in the sense of ‘demonstration’. Having learnt one’s lessons through analysis, one could then apply those lessons: “Genesis is not the study of given examples as analysis is, but is rather the making of a new work” (quoted in Ong 1958, 264). For Ramus, then, ‘analysis’ was not a method of solving problems, and if it can be understood as a method of discovery, then it only involved learning what was already known. It is in this way that ‘analysis’ and ‘synthesis’ in the Aristotelian sense could be collapsed together into Ramus’s one simple method—the method of presenting knowledge already attained. It is the disregarding of the problem-solving or genuinely heuristic aspect of analysis, as conceived by Aristotle and the geometers, that Descartes was to condemn in the following century (see the supplementary section on Descartes and Analytic Geometry).

Zabarella

If Ramus represents the Platonist, anti-Aristotelian pole in the debate over method, then Zabarella represents the Aristotelian pole. Central to Zabarella’s account of method was precisely Aristotle’s distinction between understanding ‘the fact’ and understanding ‘the reason why’, as articulated in the Posterior Analytics, a work on which Zabarella wrote a detailed commentary. According to Zabarella, the two methods involved here—the methodus resolutiva (analysis) and methodus compositiva (synthesis)—are to be combined in providing the joint method for natural philosophy, all other methods, such as Plato’s method of division, being inadequate to generate genuine knowledge. (Cf. Copenhaver and Schmitt 1992, 118–21; N. Jardine 1988, 689–93.) Zabarella may have failed to recognise the importance of mathematics, which was to play a decisive role in the forthcoming scientific revolution; but his idea of the double method was to influence Galileo in his inauguration of that revolution.

If there is one method of analysis that does lie at the root of subsequent methods, it is that utilised in ancient Greek geometry, but this was not appreciated until fairly late in the Renaissance. Pappus’s famous account of analysis was only translated into Latin by Federigo Commandino in 1589. At first, as had happened with other translations of Greek texts, the rendering of the Greek terms ‘analusis’ and ‘sunthesis’ by ‘resolutio’ and ‘compositio’ encouraged conflation of the various methods, but gradually, as the significance of geometrical analysis sunk in, the original Greek terms were reappropriated (in their transliterated form) to signal the more exact meaning. (Cf. Gilbert 1960, 81–3.) The wider connotations of the terms ‘resolution’ and ‘composition’ remained, however, and these soon transferred themselves to the Greek terms too, an attachment that has persisted to the present day, causing confusion ever since.

Annotated Bibliography, §3.6

7. Conclusion

The medieval period was characterized by the reception, elaboration, and often critique of ancient philosophy, with a sense of preservation and sometimes renewal developed through the ever burgeoning commentarial traditions. This applied no less to the conceptions and forms of analysis that had originated in the ancient period. Ancient Greek geometry and Aristotelian logic provided the key models in the European and Arabic philosophical traditions, the Nyāya and Buddhist inference-schemas in the Indian tradition, concern with tracing everything back to the One in Neoplatonism and Neo-Confucianism, and ‘sliding scales of analysis’ in Indian and Chinese Buddhism.

There are interesting comparisons to be made between the various traditions, even if there is little evidence of direct influence, except for the Indian Buddhist influence on Chinese thinking and the role played by Arabic philosophy in transmitting ancient Greek thought into the medieval Latin world. At the more recognizably ‘analytic’ end (as it might be seen today), progress was made in specific areas of logic, such as in gaining clarity about quantification. Both Buridan and Dharmakīrti offered analyses of ‘only’, to give just one example, which involved reformulating sentences in a more technical language. At the more ‘synthetic’ end, there was concern to see how everything fitted into the One (whether ‘God’ or ‘lǐ’), especially in the Neoplatonist and Neo-Confucian traditions. Both ‘analytic’ and ‘synthetic’ thinking were to be developed in more sophisticated forms in the modern period.