Animal Thought

First published Thu Sep 24, 2026

Can non-human animals think? If they can, what kinds of thoughts do they have? What intellectual and cognitive processes are involved in their thinking? And how do these thoughts vary from species to species? All of these questions are highly controversial and have sparked heated debates, both philosophical and empirical, over the past few decades.

When approaching these questions, a significant difficulty to deal with is that the answers depend, to a large extent, on how one understands thought and thinking. Yet these two notions vary widely in the literature. Some philosophers and scientists use both terms loosely to refer to a very broad spectrum of cognitive processes and mental states, including extremely “simple” or “primitive” ones (Glock 2000; Jamieson 2009). Other scholars use the notion of thought, when engaging in debates about animal cognition, to refer to a subtype of mental states mediating between perception and action (Beck 2012a) and allowing us to understand things in our world, solve problems, and make decisions (Andrews 2020). Some add to this, extending to animals the “standard view” on the matter (Andrews 2020), that thoughts must have a propositional nature (Davidson 1982 [2001]; Burge 2010). Others consider that thinkers must employ their thoughts rationally and spontaneously in higher cognitive and intellectual processes, such as reasoning, remembering the past, imagining the future, conjecturing possible scenarios, etc. (Bermúdez 2003; Camp 2009a). Furthermore, there are philosophers who claim that genuine rational thinking involves the capacity to reflect on one’s thoughts, evaluate, and correct them (Davidson 1982 [2001]; McDowell 1996; Boyle 2018). In any case, our answers to questions about whether animals think, what they can think, and how to characterize their thinking will vary depending on the view one adopts regarding what thinking and thoughts are.

Another key difficulty faced by those interested in studying the possibility, and eventually the nature, of non-human animal thought is that we lack a clear and well-established theoretical framework to think about these issues (Bermúdez 2003, viii). Over the last two decades, however, several philosophers and scientists working on animal cognition have offered a range of proposals on how to understand animal thoughts, their contents and vehicles, and how these thoughts are employed to think about the past, prepare for the future, make inferences, etc. All these theoretical efforts are, and must be, intertwined with the search for empirical evidence regarding the cognitive abilities of different non-human species. However, these empirical endeavors present their own difficulties. Many challenges arise when conducting studies on other species: our knowledge of their behavior and cognition remains fragmentary, controversies about how to interpret the available evidence abound, and there is still a lot of work to do to integrate what we know about their behavioral and cognitive capacities into a broader picture. That said, in this entry, it will not be possible to cover all the relevant empirical and philosophical work. Therefore, the following is simply an introductory overview of several key debates on the topic, highlighting some significant philosophical views and some of the most relevant empirical results.

1. Deflationary or Minimalist Approaches to Animal Thought

Several philosophers accept that non-human animals can engage in some thinking or proto-thinking, but still draw a sharp distinction between the severely limited thoughts or proto-thoughts of most (if not all) non-human animals and human thoughts. One alleged key difference is that animal thinking has an exclusively perceptual, pragmatic, and context-bound nature (Bermúdez 2003). Unlike humans, animals cannot significantly detach their thinking from current perceptual stimuli. Another frequently suggested difference is that animals cannot distance themselves from their practical concerns and represent “pure facts” (Millikan 2004).

An illustration of this deflationary view can be found in Michael Dummett’s work (1993). According to him, non-linguistic animals only have “proto-thoughts” of a perceptual and practical nature, which they cannot detach from present circumstances and which can only occur as an integral part of their current activities. As animals perceive their environment, they not only see the shapes, material properties, and positions of the objects around them; they also detect how their actions might transform what they perceive. While evaluating such thoughts as true or false does not seem accurate, it is still possible to assess them as correct or incorrect. Yet their correctness conditions should be understood in terms of the success or failure of the actions they prescribe (Dummett 1993; Bermúdez 2003). Similarly, Adrian Cussins (1992) suggests that non-human animals have mental states whose contents do not refer to an objective world and are not evaluable as true or false. Rather, these mental states have primitive “mediational contents”, which present the possibilities for action offered by the distal environment to the perceiving organism, given its practical abilities.

Other deflationary accounts emphasize, as a distinctive feature of animal thoughts, that they can guide action immediately and without inferential mediation. Ruth Millikan, probably the most prominent advocate of this view, holds that many (if not all) non-human animals possess only “pushmi-pullyu representations”, which guide their immediate actions directly and non-inferentially (Millikan 1995; 2004). Traditional propositional attitudes, such as beliefs and desires, are divided into those that have a descriptive function—representing how things are in the world—and those that possess a directive function— motivating or directing their owners to act in some way. As a result, creatures in possession of propositional attitudes must inferentially combine some of their descriptive and motivational mental states to arrive at a conclusion about how to act. In contrast, pushmi-pullyu representations are Janus-faced representations that simultaneously fulfill descriptive and prescriptive functions. In this way, they tell their owners how things are in the world and what they should do about it, without requiring any inferential mediation. Millikan suggests that pushmi-pullyu representations are evolutionary precursors to purely descriptive and directive representations, and that many (if not all) non-human animals are mere “pushmi-pullyu animals”. However, she also believes that these representations guide many primitive human responses. Unlike other deflationist approaches previously considered, Millikan’s pushmi-pullyu representations often refer to events distant both in space and time. Despite this, animals can only instantiate them in response to perceptions of current events or states of affairs that indicate that something occurred in the past, will take place in the future, or is happening somewhere else.

Tamar Gendler (2008a, 2008b) also posits a primitive variety of representational mental states, “aliefs”, which are shared by human and non-human animals and guide their behavior in an immediate, non-inferential way. This is because, unlike traditional beliefs, aliefs do not have descriptive contents whose function is to track how things are. Instead, they are associative, automatic, arational, and affect-laden. Moreover, they have complex associatively linked contents that include: (a) the representation of some object, situation or circumstance; (b) the experience of affective or emotional states; (c) the readying of some motor routine (Gendler 2008a, 643).

Many scholars (including philosophers already mentioned, like Millikan and Cussins) draw on the notion of “affordances”, originally introduced by ecological psychologist J.J. Gibson (see e.g. 1979), in their attempts to provide minimalist accounts of animal behavior in their environments. In Gibson’s original view, affordances are the resources, or the opportunities for action, that the environment offers to those animals possessing the capacities to perceive and exploit them. The notion is relational and ecological: animals perceive different affordances in their environment as they move around and explore it, depending not only on the objective physical properties of their surroundings but also on their varying physical constitutions and capacities. Hence, a tree affords climbing to a chimpanzee, while it affords pushing over to an elephant, perching on its branches to a bird, etc. (Bermúdez 2003; Barrett 2011). Explaining animal behavior in terms of affordances implies emphasizing the immediate and direct perceptual nature of their cognition and also its active character: if animals perceive affordances, instead of mere objects, properties, or states of affairs, “what goes on in an animal’s head (whatever that might turn out to be) cannot be separated from how it moves its body about in the world” (Barrett 2011, 98). A number of advocates of affordances are committed to developing radically anti-representationalist and anti-cognitivist accounts of basic cognition, which eschew invoking any processing or manipulation of mental states with intentional content to explain animal behavior (Kiverstein & Rietveld 2015; Hutto & Satne 2015; Hutto & Myin 2017).[1]Additionally, some of them draw a sharp contrast between the non-representational cognitive processes that guide the immediate and unreflective responses to environmental affordances of (human and non-human) animals and the contentful thoughts and utterances that can be deployed by linguistic human animals, who are the only animals that have “benefited from the right kind of cultural scaffolding” (Hutto & Myin 2017, 123; see also Hutto & Satne 2015).

2. Beyond Minimalism: Detached Thoughts in Nonhuman Animals

Against the minimalist accounts discussed in the previous section, many philosophers and scientists argue that a wealth of empirical evidence on animal behavior can be explained only if we attribute to them representational mental states whose contents go beyond what is happening here and now. In other words, these researchers claim that some animals have thoughts that allow them to gain some “detachment”, “distance”, or “stimulus-independence” from their current situations and the immediate perceptual stimulus impinging on their senses (Gärdenfors 1995; Bermúdez 2003; Camp 2009a; Huber 2024). In what follows, I will discuss several ways this can occur: by thinking about the past or forming memories, by thinking about the future or exhibiting some kind of future-oriented cognition, by representing possible states of affairs, events, or objects, and by reflecting on one’s thoughts.

2.1 Animal Memories: Learning from Past Experiences and Thinking About the Past

One way in which animals’ knowledge or information may extend beyond what they can perceive at the moment is through memory, that is, the capacity to retain and employ information acquired through past experiences. An influential distinction in the study of memory is the one between semantic and episodic memory. Semantic memory refers to a relatively permanent and general knowledge of facts or events, gathered through various senses and flexibly accessible to the subject (Tulving 2005; Raby & Clayton 2009; Zentall 2013). In contrast, episodic memory was first characterized as the ability to remember a singular past episode or event, including what happened, where it happened, and when (Tulving 1972). Later, Tulving expanded this definition, adding that episodic memories must include “autonoetic consciousness”, which refers to the subjective awareness of having experienced the remembered event, and the capacity to engage in mental time travel, transporting oneself into the personal past (as well as into the future) and re-experiencing what happened (Tulving 2005).[2]

Comparative psychologists have made considerable efforts to test whether animals can not only remember general facts but also recall episodic past experiences. Clayton and Dickinson developed the classic paradigm to study episodic memory by testing whether caching birds, such as scrub jays, can remember the “what, where, and when” of a food-caching event (i.e., what happened, when it happened, and where). Researchers allowed scrub jays to cache peanuts on one side of a tray and worms on the other. During training trials, the scrub jays learned that worms, originally their favorite food, decay over time. During the test trials, the birds were allowed, half of the time, to search for the hidden food after a short period of 4 hours, while on the other half, they could only search for it after 124 hours. The researchers reasoned that if scrub jays had an integrated memory of what they cached, where, and when the caching events took place, they should look for the worms first after the short interval of 4 hours and for the peanuts first after the 124-hour interval (since, as they have learned, after this period the worms must have decayed). Scrub jays behaved during the experiments exactly as predicted (Clayton & Dickinson 1998, 1999). Similar results were obtained with other animals, including other birds (Feeney et al. 2009; Zinkivskay et al. 2009), rats (Babb & Crystal 2006; Zhou & Crystal 2009), nonhuman primates (Martin-Ordas et al. 2010), and even some invertebrates such as cuttlefish and bees (Pahl et al. 2007; Jozet-Alves et al. 2013).

Although remembering where, when, and what happened appears to play a crucial role in episodic memory, it is neither sufficient nor necessary for it. The reason it is not necessary is that one may episodically remember a particular event without precisely recalling where or when it happened (Suddendorf & Busby 2003; Zentall 2013; Osvath & Martin-Ordas 2014). And it is not sufficient either, because one can know all these things without remembering that particular past episode (Suddendorf & Busby 2003). This led Tulving to add that episodic memories also essentially involve the subjective phenomenological experience of “mentally reliving” the event (Tulving 2005; Boyle 2020). In an attempt to leave aside taxing debates concerning whether animals possess such phenomenal experiences, and how to establish if this is so given their lack of language, Clayton and Dickinson relabeled their findings as cases of ‘episodic-like memory’ (Clayton & Dickinson 1998). Following a different strategy, Alexandria Boyle (2020) argues, against previous views on the topic (Clayton et al. 2009; Hoerl & McCormack 2019), that the phenomenological features that compose the experience of “mentally reliving an event” can be empirically tested, even in non-linguistic animals. Hence, it remains an open empirical question whether some non-human species can experience these memories with their typical phenomenological features. Also, she urges us to consider that, like any other cognitive trait, episodic memory may exhibit species-specific variations. Therefore, even if animals’ memories of events lack the phenomenological components characteristic of human episodic memory, they may still be a variant of the same phenomenon and not merely a phenomenon “like” the original (Boyle 2022; Boyle & Brown 2025).

It seems clear that whether non-human animals possess episodic memory and are capable of mental time travel is still a highly controversial topic. Some researchers argue that this is a unique human capacity and that even though non-human animals may be able to learn from past events and to deal adequately with situations involving the unfolding of events over time, only humans can explicitly represent past events as such or reason about them (Tulving 2005; Suddendorf & Corballis 1997, 2007; Roberts 2002; Suddendorf & Busby 2003; Hoerl & McCormack 2019).[3] In defense of this exceptionality claim, it is frequently maintained that episodic memory involves several complex cognitive capacities, including self-awareness and meta-representational abilities to think about one’s representations as such. Thus, it is argued that episodic memory requires not only the representation of a past event, but also the ability to think about one’s memory as a representation of one’s past and to consider the remembered event as an experience that one’s former self had (Suddendorf & Corballis 1997; Redshaw 2014). Others, by contrast, find it more plausible to explain the available evidence by admitting that some elements of episodic memory are present, at least to some degree, in non-human species (Raby & Clayton 2009; Osvath & Martin-Ordas 2014).[4] Interestingly, even those who adopt the most demanding notion of episodic memory, and as a result are skeptical regarding the possibility of attributing it to non-human animals, often reinterpret the relevant evidence as showing that many animals, including birds and mammals, possess semantic memory systems that enable them to learn general facts from past experiences (Suddendorf & Busby 2003; Tulving 2005). Hence, it seems to be widely accepted now that many animals have the capacity to flexibly recall some factual information. This may include only general knowledge about the world, if these animals possess only semantic memory, or it may also include memories of particular past events, if they possess episodic memory as well. In any case, this capacity suffices to endow them with some level or degree of representational independence from current stimuli.

2.2 Animal Future-Oriented Cognition

Another kind of representational distance is shown by creatures capable of detaching their thoughts from current circumstances by thinking about the future or, more loosely, engaging in some form of “future-oriented cognition” (Osvath & Martin-Ordas 2014). Although there is no clear definition of what future-oriented cognition encompasses, many cognitive abilities appear to play a role in the capacity of different animals to prepare themselves for future events, including foreseeing what will happen, simulating future events, making plans, engaging in complex and temporally extended projects, and anticipating future preferences. In addition to this, there is some agreement that a number of animal species may exhibit behaviors that are well adapted to upcoming events—i.e., they may engage in future-oriented behavior— but purely as a result of inflexible innate processes that are not about the future in any significant sense (Redshaw & Bulley 2018). Classic examples of these are fixed action patterns, such as nest building, provisioning, or hibernation, which are triggered by seasonal cues (Raby & Clayton 2009). Other future-oriented responses may arise as a consequence of associative learning processes that occur when a response to a stimulus is reliably followed by a reward. Some researchers admit that these associative processes may involve a representation of the reward to be obtained, but they do not require explicit planning, mental time travelling, or thinking about the future as such (Suddendorf & Corballis 2007; Raby & Clayton 2009). In contrast, as the flexibility and context independence of animal behavioral responses in adapting to future events increases, we are more justified in conjecturing that they are guided by cognitive capacities that are “more” future-oriented, even if they do not share all the distinctive features of human future-oriented cognition (Clayton et al. 2009; Raby & Clayton 2009; Osvath & Martin-Ordas 2014).

A particularly advanced and versatile variety of future-oriented cognition is episodic future-thinking, which, according to several researchers, relies on mechanisms shared with episodic memory and, like it, involves a capacity for “mental time travel” (Suddendorf & Corballis 1997, 2007). On this view, while episodic memory allows one to mentally travel back in time and re-experience past events, future episodic memory enables one to travel forward in time to pre-experience future events. Raby and Clayton (2009) hold that creatures capable of episodic future thinking can project themselves into the future and represent themselves as part of an imagined future scenario. These authors additionally focus on another type of future-oriented cognition: “semantic prospection” (see also Suddendorf & Corballis 2007). This is the ability to represent scenarios set in the future (scenarios depicting, for example, what is likely to happen when one embarks on a journey for food or when one is about to go hunting), but without necessarily envisioning oneself personally experiencing the represented situations. Although semantic prospection involves some explicit representation of the future, it does not require mental time travel.

Several empirical paradigms provide evidence of fairly sophisticated capacities for future-oriented cognition, such as semantic prospection or even episodic memory, in non-human animals. Some of this data comes from sequential tool-use tasks (i.e., tasks in which a tool must be used to obtain a non-food object that can then function as a second tool to reach for some food). New Caledonian crows, for instance, can complete up to three-step sequential tool tasks (Wimpenny et al. 2009; Taylor et al. 2010), while chimpanzees, bonobos, and orangutans complete tasks with up to five steps (Martin-Ordas et al. 2012). To accomplish this, animals must identify and execute a temporally extended sequence of actions that have yet to occur. All of this raises the question of whether they need to have “some sense of at least the immediate future” (Raby & Clayton 2009, 320). There are also reports of other primates, such as capuchin monkeys (Anderson & Henneman 1994) and Japanese macaques (Hihara et al., 2003), as well as large-brained birds like rooks (Bird & Emery 2009) and Goffin’s cockatoos (Auersperg et al. 2013), succeeding in complex sequential tool-use tasks.

Other experimenters examine whether animals can select tools and use them after a delay to solve a task and get a reward, suggesting some capacity to anticipate future problems. In one of these studies, conducted by Osvath and Osvath (2008), two chimpanzees and an orangutan selected the tool needed to obtain a food reward (which would be available in another room later), kept it, and later transported it to the reward room. Mulcahy and Call (2006a) found similar results with bonobos and orangutans. Similarly, New Caledonian crows select appropriate tools for future tasks, preferring them both over immediate food rewards and over tools that had been more strongly associated with rewards in the past (Boeckle et al. 2020). A similar experiment showed that great apes can prepare tools to obtain, in the near future, a currently unavailable reward (Bräuer & Call 2015). Along the same lines, observations of wild chimpanzees indicate that they arrive at termite nests carrying tools that they have prepared while the nests were still out of sight and that they then use to extract termites (Sanz et al. 2004; Musgrave et al. 2024). They also carry stones over long distances to trees where nuts are processed (Boesch & Boesch 1984).[5]

Suddendorf and Corballis (1997) have argued that a critical feature of future thinking is that animals capable of it can act in the present, influenced by a future motivation or need, independently of their current motivational states. Based on this idea, some researchers have focused on whether animals can anticipate and prepare for future needs that diverge from their current ones. Their findings suggest that some non-human species may have such capacities. Raby et al. (2007) gave scrub jays food to cache when they were not hungry, in the evening. They found that the birds cached more food in the compartments where they had previously learned they would not be fed in the morning, rather than where they were usually given breakfast. The birds cached significantly more food in the “no-breakfast” compartment, which suggests that they could anticipate their hunger the next morning. In a second experiment, the birds were always given breakfast in the morning, but the type of food varied depending on the compartment they were in. For example, they were fed dog kibble in compartment A and peanuts in compartment B. When allowed to cache both kinds of food in the evening, they preferentially stored in each compartment the kind of food they would not be fed there in the morning (e.g., dog kibble in compartment B and peanuts in compartment A). These results can be interpreted as indicating that these birds cache food in anticipation of their future motivational states (see also Correia et al. 2007 and Cheke & Clayton 2012 for additional evidence of planning for future needs in Western scrub jays and Eurasian jays).

As with episodic memory, there is also much controversy over how to interpret the available evidence on future-oriented cognition. A key question is whether the results of responses well adapted to future events, such as those discussed so far, are evidence that animals indeed have a concept of time, or a sense of time, that allows them to think about the future as such (Roberts 2002; 2012). A common objection to many studies on animal future-oriented cognition is that they involve only associative learning or are the result of rigid innate mechanisms, which need not require any representation of future events (Suddendorf & Corballis 2007; Suddendorf et al. 2009). However, at least in some cases, researchers have provided experimental controls designed to rule out that alternative or, at least, make it extremely unlikely (see, for instance, Osvath & Osvath 2008 and Cheke & Clayton 2012). According to a slightly less deflationary explanation, animals may anticipate some events, but only when this does not require going beyond the present context and current motivations (Suddendorf & Corballis 1997). Lastly, as mentioned before, a more robust, though still not fully-fledged, variety of future-oriented cognition may be “semantic prospection”: the capacity to think about the future without projecting oneself into it (Raby & Clayton 2009).

In any case, there is a spectrum of views in the literature, providing different interpretations of the available empirical results. Some of them emphasize continuities between human and animal future thinking (e.g., Clayton et al. 2003; Roberts 2012; Osvath & Martin-Ordas 2014), while others tend to highlight discontinuities and argue that non-human future-oriented cognition is severely limited (Suddendorf & Corballis 1997, 2007; Roberts 2002; Tulving 2005; Redshaw 2014; Hoerl & McCormack 2019). However, as Redshaw and Bulley (2018) point out, these different views agree that future thinking is not an all-or-none phenomenon, that at least some animals can represent more than just perceptual information about the present, and that there are relevant differences between human and animal future thinking. Hence, even if there are still unresolved controversies regarding the kind (or degree) of separation from current stimuli animals deploy in their future-oriented behaviors, there also seems to be abundant evidence that a number of them adapt their behavior to future events by using representations that go beyond what is strictly happening in their immediately perceivable environment.

2.3 Thinking About What is Possible: Representing Non-Actual Objects, Events and States of Affairs

Thinking about the past or the future is not the only way in which animals may detach themselves from their current circumstances and the stimuli impinging on them. Another way to accomplish this is by thinking about possible objects or states of affairs while in some sense realizing that they are not actual (or at least treating them as such). According to some scholars, animals show this capacity, for example, when they engage in instrumental reasoning (Camp 2009a; Suddendorf & Whiten 2001; Camp & Shupe 2018). This is so because instrumental reasoners must identify a way to achieve a goal through a series of intermediate actions, each of which produces a subsidiary state of affairs. Yet, to do this, these animals must represent the relevant subsidiary states of affairs while noting that (i) they are not currently the case and (ii) their obtaining would “centrally contribute” to achieving the primary goal. Although the issue remains a matter of debate, some philosophers believe there is “substantial, if not incontrovertible", evidence indicating that some non-human animals are capable of instrumental reasoning (Camp & Shupe 2018, 105). The clearest examples, according to them, come from experiments involving complex sequential instances of toolmaking and tool use by animals like chimpanzees and New Caledonian crows (as illustrated by the studies described in section 2.2).

Instrumental reasoning is of theoretical interest to our discussion because, as Camp and Shupe remark, it not only involves stepping back from one’s current circumstances and representing possible states of affairs that are not the case, but also distinguishing them from what is currently the case, so that one can take the necessary steps to reach one’s final goal. Following Josef Perner (1991), they argue that this requires “primary representations”, which allow their possessors to represent what happens out there in the world, as well as “secondary representations”. Secondary representations are a more complex and sophisticated subtype of representations, which are decoupled from reality, in the sense that they can be held in mind simultaneously with representations of how things are, without being confused with them. They also make it possible for their possessors to entertain multiple offline representational models with different functions: representing how things were in the past, how things will be in the future, or, as happens in the case of instrumental reasoning, how things could be in a counterfactual situation.

Suddendorf and Whiten (2001) also adopt Perner’s framework and explicitly claim that some animals, particularly great apes, are likely to possess secondary representations. Roughly, they argue as follows: the acquisition of these representations underlies and enables the emergence in human children of a host of other abilities, such as the capacity to understand hidden displacements, means-end reasoning, pretense, empathy, some basic capacities to interpret external representations, mirror self-recognition, etc. They reason that, if great apes display these different cognitive capacities, they probably possess secondary representations, much like human children.

To briefly recapitulate, when arguing in favor of secondary representations in great apes, these researchers take into account several cognitive capacities, besides means-end reasoning, which also seem to involve representing non-actual states of affairs. Pretend play is a clear example to consider. At around 1–2 years of age, human children begin to engage in this kind of play, treating some objects “as if” they were other objects, or acting “as if” things were different from what they are, and doing so outside a directly functional context (Gómez & Martín-Andrade 2005). For instance, they pretend that a cardboard box is a boat or that a rock is a phone, without confusing what these objects are with what they take them to be in play contexts. Although we would need more research before reaching a firmer conclusion on the topic, there is some evidence of pretend play in great apes. There are observations of home-reared and enculturated great apes playing with dolls and toy animals (Hayes 1951; Savage-Rumbaugh & Lewin 1994; McCune & Agayoff 2002). Both captive and home-reared chimpanzees have also been occasionally observed acting as if they were playing or interacting with non-existent objects, eating imaginary food, etc. (Hayes 1951; Savage-Rumbaugh & Lewin 1994; Matsuzawa 2020), and we do have some reports of young chimpanzees in the wild or in outdoor laboratories manipulating logs as if they were dolls (Kahlenberg & Wrangham 2010; Matsuzawa 2020), wearing a grass cushion—abandoned by a human—and walking bipedally, as humans do when wearing this artifact, or carrying and grooming the corpse of a hyrax as chimpanzee mothers do with their infants (Matsuzawa 2020). Additionally, captive chimpanzees have been observed playing with toy phones, acting as if they were drinking from a cup, toying with dead animals, etc. (Matsuzawa 2020). Finally, Bastos and Krupenye (2026) provide the first experimental evidence that Kanzi, an enculturated bonobo, can correctly identify the location of a pretend object (pretend juice or grapes) in a shared pretense interaction.

Another question relevant to our current discussion is whether animals facing uncertain outcomes can represent alternative results and prepare for them. Evidence of such a capacity would indicate that they can represent what is not yet the case while considering different incompatible possibilities at the same time. A study by Redshaw and Suddendorf (2016) examined this capacity to anticipate two incompatible outcomes of a future event in 2- to 4-year-old children and a sample of eight great apes. In this experiment, subjects were allowed to catch a ball or a grape dropped into a forked-tubed apparatus with one opening at the top and two possible exits at the bottom. Most 4-year-old children consistently covered both exits from the first trial, suggesting that they can represent both possible outcomes. However, great apes (and most 2- to 3-year-old human children) did not spontaneously cover both exits when preparing to catch the item. These results suggest that they may be unable to spontaneoulsy consider and prepare for multiple, mutually exclusive future outcomes (similar difficulties were found in a study by Suddendorf et al. 2017).

It has been objected, against these studies, that the response of covering the openings of both tubes with one’s hands does not come naturally to chimpanzees. With this fact in view, Engelmann et al. (2023) tested chimpanzees using a different, allegedly more suitable, experimental paradigm. In their experiments, the subjects were faced with two pieces of food placed on different tiltable platforms, and they could only access these items by protecting them from a human competitor. The human attempted to steal the food by dropping a stone through a tube. This action caused one of the platforms to tilt towards the human, making the reward roll outside the chimpanzees’ reach. In the “single tube condition”, the tube had only one exit, and the chimpanzees could predict with certainty which food platform the competitor would target with the stone. In the “Y-shaped tube condition”, the tube had two exits, and the chimpanzees could not predict which platform would be hit by the stone. Chimpanzees were significantly more likely to protect both platforms, by stabilizing them with their hands in the Y-shaped tube condition than in the single tube condition. These results suggest that, when facing an uncertain future situation, these animals can simultaneously represent alternative possibilities (see also Engelmann et al. 2021, for additional evidence that chimpanzees can represent alternative possibilities in a situation of epistemic uncertainty, and Redshaw & Suddendorf 2024, for a critical discussion of this interpretation).

In brief, evidence of non-human animals’ abilities to represent non-actual, hypothetical, or merely possible objects or situations is still scarce, and sometimes mixed. Yet, we do have some initial data suggesting that great apes may be able to represent non-actual entities and states of affairs, at least to some degree. In order to establish on firmer ground which species can represent mere possibilities, in what contexts, and to what extent, much more research is needed.

2.4 Reflective Animals?

A final and particularly dramatic kind of independence from current stimuli is displayed by creatures capable of taking their thoughts as objects of further thought. Creatures that enjoy these reflective capacities can use them to form second-order judgments about their first-order perceptions or beliefs, understanding their representational nature and normatively assessing their justification, correctness, truth values, etc. (Davidson 1982 [2001]; McDowell 1996; Bermúdez 2003). This not only requires meta-representational capacities but also a complex net of semantic, epistemic, and psychological concepts, allowing them to think thoughts such as this belief is false, and this belief is unjustified. Furthermore, reflective creatures can step back from their beliefs and desires, and call them into question by asking themselves whether there are good reasons to acquire those beliefs or follow those motivations (Korsgaard 1996). Creatures with this reflective capacity to distance themselves from their own mental states enjoy a more powerful and finer control over their minds and actions. Reflecting on whether their motivations are a good reason to act in a particular way may lead them to refrain from acting in that way, even if they desire to do so, or it may incline them to do something different. Similarly, thinking about the epistemic credentials of their first-order thoughts may help them become better at noticing their errors (Camp 2009a).

Many philosophers have insisted that such demanding capacities are language-dependent and exclusively human (famous examples include Davidson 1982 [2001]; McDowell 1996; Korsgaard 1996, 2009; Boyle 2018). Moreover, for most of these philosophers, being a reflective animal changes our minds dramatically, setting us apart from other species. John McDowell argues, for example, that such reflective capacities turn humans into rational subjects “who are in charge of their thinking” (McDowell 1996, 114). Following McDowell, Matthew Boyle (2018) further argues that reflection does not merely add a new capacity to the basic cognitive abilities and mental states we share with other animals. Rather, it transforms these previous abilities and mental states and makes us the only genuinely rational animals. Even more radically, Donald Davidson claims that since non-linguistic animals cannot think about their thoughts, they don’t have minds at all (Davidson 1982 [2001]).

However, not everyone agrees with this classic picture. Some philosophers admit that non-human animals probably lack reflective capacities, but claim that these capacities are not necessary for being rational animals or creatures with minds. Along these lines, Elisabeth Camp (2009a) suggests that what makes a mind powerful is its ability to think a broad variety of thoughts and to apply them to a wide range of situations, rather than its ability to reflect on its thoughts. Others argue that animals that lack reflective and meta-representational abilities may still be able to rationally revise what they believe by contrasting the first-order contents of their previous and current beliefs and perceptions (i.e., by realizing that things are not in way P but that they are in another way Q) (Glock 2009; Rowlands 2019; Danón & Kalpokas 2024). Recently, Melis and Monsó (2024) have explored an even more ambitious path, arguing that, despite their lack of language, some non-human animals may engage in reflective processes of belief formation and belief revision by individuating and explicitly assessing relevant evidence (particularly evidence coming from unreliable sources). Some studies with chimpanzees broadly support this view. These experimental findings suggest that chimpanzees can: (i) explicitly represent and compare the information in favor of two different options and select the one supported by the stronger evidence, (ii) differentiate between evidence coming from a new source and redundant information from an old source, and (iii) show some sensitivity to second-order evidence about the reliability of their first-order evidence (Schleihauf et al. 2025).

Taken together, this philosophical and empirical work hints at the exciting possibility that some non-human animals might be able to engage in rational and reflective processes of belief revision. It would follow from this that some animals may enjoy, at least to a certain degree, the specific distance from current stimuli and control of their thinking that reflectivity grants.

3. The Content of Animal Thoughts: Propositional or Non-Propositional?

A long philosophical tradition has understood thoughts to be complex mental states composed of a psychological attitude (such as believing, conjecturing, doubting, etc.) toward a content (that which is thought). These classical views have standardly assumed that the contents of thoughts are propositional. Nevertheless, there is considerable debate over how the notion of “propositional content” should be understood and over what creatures can possess thoughts with such contents.

According to a minimalist or liberal use of the notion, propositional contents represent some things as being in a certain way. In paradigmatic cases, like John is friendly or that flower is red, propositional contents refer to a particular and attribute a property to it. Additionally, it must be possible for an external observer to evaluate such contents as true or false or, more leniently, as correct or incorrect (Schroeder 2006; Camp 2009a; Grzankowski 2013; Mitchell 2019; Morgan 2019; Shea 2024). As Alexander Morgan (2019) argues, if one accepts such a liberal view of propositional contents, there will be justification for attributing them not only to all kinds of animals but also to plants. For some, this trivializes the notion of propositional content.

At the other end of the spectrum, some philosophers defend a full-blown notion of propositional content. This view holds that propositional contents must not only represent something as being thus-and-so, but they must also have a sentence-like structure. This means at least two things. Firstly, just as sentences have words as their constituents, propositional contents must be composed of concepts (or conceptual abilities). Secondly, it must be possible for these concepts to be recombined in any admissible way to form new propositional contents. In other words, creatures whose thoughts have propositional contents must satisfy Gareth Evans’ Generality Constraint (Evans 1982; Campbell 1986; Camp 2004; Shea 2024). It is usually added that the subject who has such contents must be able to detach their constituent concepts and grasp their meaning independently of their application to any particular situation (Cussins 1992; Camp 2015). Finally, advocates of a full-fledged notion of propositional contents believe that these contents have a subject-predicate structure, that at least some of them must incorporate universal and existential quantifiers, and that their owners must have the capacity to combine them by employing all kinds of logical connectives (Burge 2010, 2022; Shea 2024).

Once one adopts the full-blown view, the attribution of thoughts with propositional contents to non-human animals becomes highly controversial for several reasons. First of all, even if non-human animals have capacities for conceptual recombination, these are probably limited. They may not be able to combine some concepts with others when the resulting thoughts are entirely useless to solve their practical needs (Camp 2009a). Moreover, the analog format of some of their representations may prevent some combinations (Beck 2012a), or they might not be capable of recombining concepts from different domains (Carruthers 2006). It is also highly contentious whether non-human animals can use logical connectors and quantifiers (Sellars 1981; Bermúdez 2003). I will return to this topic in section 5.

One way to overcome such difficulties is by developing an intermediate view of propositional contents. In that view, propositional contents must represent things as being thus-and-so and have truth values, while also satisfying two further requirements. The first requirement is that they must be composed of minimal representational units, concepts, and their possessors must have the capacity to recombine these concepts in some ways (but not necessarily in every admissible way, as demanded by the Generality Constraint) (Carruthers 2009).[6] Secondly, possessors of propositional contents must have conceptual abilities of two distinct kinds: the ability to think about certain particulars, and the ability to think about several general properties and attribute those properties to them (Sellars 1981; Danón 2022). Once we understand propositional contents in this way, we know what kind of evidence we should look for to attribute such contents to non-human animals: we need indicators that they can identify and re-identify the same particular entities and attribute various general properties to them. It has been argued that we can find compelling examples of such capacities, for instance, in the well-developed and differentiated relationships that non-human primates establish with other individual members of their group or in the close relationships between dogs and their caretakers (Danón 2022).

There is disagreement, however, about the necessity of introducing propositional contents into animal behavior explanations. Some deflationist philosophers deny that non-human animals can have mental states with genuine propositional contents and instead defend the view that their behavior can be explained by invoking simpler non-propositional contents of one kind or another. Generally, two main types of non-propositionalist views about animal mental contents have been offered.

According to the first view, animals may possess a more primitive kind of mental contents, originally baptized by P. F. Strawson as “feature-placing” representations. Unlike propositional contents, feature-placing thoughts do not refer to particulars or involve the ascription of properties to them. Instead, these contents are composed of representations of features “placed” in a creature’s surroundings (Strawson 1953, 1959; Cussins 1992; Burge 2010), such as water here or raining there. Yet, as Burge remarks, the spatiotemporal elements that figure in these contents are “vague and gestural rather than genuinely referential” and cannot function to “identify definite spatial regions or temporal intervals” (Burge 2010, 165). Some philosophers, such as Adrian Cussins (1992), believe that the notion of feature-placing contents is a valuable tool to account for the specificity of non-human animal thinking (see also Chemero 2003 and Proust 2013). Others, like Tyler Burge (2010), argue instead that perception, which is the most basic form of mind, necessarily involves reference to particulars and the attribution of properties to them.[7] So, feature-placing contents may exist, and some non-human animals may possess them, but they are not the most primitive kind of contents.

The second group of non-propositionalists proposes to explain animal behavior by positing “objectual” contents. Along these lines, Markus Wild (2023) considers the case of an animal—a dog—who responds differently to the same object—a bone—when it is in the bowl versus when it is on the table. While one might be inclined to attribute two propositional contents about the same object—e.g., that the bone is on the table and that the bone is in the bowl—to this animal, Wild claims that we can come up with a more austere explanation by attributing two contents that merely represent different objects—Object 1 and Object 2—to explain the differences in the dog’s behavior. Maria Álvarez (2023) offers a slightly more complex version of the objectual content view. According to her, we can explain cases in which the dog responds differently to the bone on the table and the bone in the bowl by claiming that the animal is representing the same objects as differently arranged or, in other words, that the dog is representing different configurations of objects.

Lastly, Dorit Bar-On (2019) defends the claim that non-linguistic animals have brute thoughts: thoughts with a content and a structure that differ systematically from our own. Roughly, she claims that brute thoughts are to be individuated by the crude meanings that these languageless creatures can communicate, and that they have prepositional contents that are about certain environmental objects. Typical examples of such brute thoughts are the fear of a certain predator or the desire for a piece of food.

It seems clear from what we have discussed so far that the debate on what kind of contents non-human animals may have and, relatedly, what kind of things they can or cannot think about has not been settled. Some philosophers believe, however, that whether mental states have propositional or non-propositional contents depends on, or is at least influenced by, the form of the vehicles that instantiate them. The following section will focus on the formats of animal thoughts.

4. The Formats of Animal Thoughts: Words, Images or Maps?

Those interested in whether animal thoughts have propositional or non-propositional contents are also often interested in the representational vehicles—i.e., the internal physical states or processes—that carry those contents and, more specifically, in the shape or format of these vehicles. External representations, such as pictures, words or maps, have representational contents carried by physical vehicles (ink marks, arrangements of pigment on a piece of paper, etc.), which are supposed to have different formats. Those vehicles represent things in specific ways, roughly, as a result of their distinctive structural or syntactic features. However, it seems more difficult to grasp the differences in format among mental representations than it is to understand similar differences in the case of observable external representations (Camp 2009b). To deal with this difficulty, many researchers have characterized the formats of mental representations as analogous to those of public representations, distinguishing, for instance, between linguistic or discursive representations, which are taken to be similar to the sentences of public languages, and pictorial or iconic representations, which are considered analogous to pictures or images (Coelho Mollo & Vernazzani 2024). Some have also proposed to individuate or differentiate representational formats in terms of the functional role that each of them plays in cognition: which kinds of contents can or cannot be represented in a given format, what representational combinations, inferences, and thought transitions are possible, impossible, easier or harder within a particular format, etc. (Camp 2009b; Boyle 2019).

Many philosophers and cognitive scientists believe that genuine thinking takes place in a “language of thought”, that is, an internal representational medium structured like a language. Furthermore, according to the language of thought hypothesis, propositional attitudes—like beliefs and desires—are specific psychological relations that thinkers bear to internal sentences, which are manipulated and transformed in inferences and decision-making processes (Bermúdez 2003).

It is possible to distinguish, however, between a strong and a weak version of this claim (Camp 2007, 2009b). According to the strong version, proposed by Jerry Fodor, all thinking occurs in a mental language that exhibits a cluster of properties characteristic of spoken languages (Fodor 1975; Beck 2018; Rescorla 2024). First, just as in spoken languages, complex mental representations in a language of thought are composed of simple constituents (concepts) in such a way that the meaning of the complex depends on the meaning of its simple constituents plus their modes of combination. Second, constituent representations hold an arbitrary relationship to their referents. Third, representations in a language of thought have a logical form: their basic mechanisms of combination include predication, quantifiers, and logical constants (Beck 2018; Rescorla 2024).

In contrast, the weak version of the language of thought hypothesis holds that thought requires a compositional representational system consisting of basic representations that can be recombined, according to some set of rules, to produce more complex structures. The key point here is that, according to this lenient interpretation, such systems do not necessarily have a sentential structure. On the contrary, as Camp argues, some non-sentential representational vehicles, like diagrams or maps, may also satisfy the compositionality requirement imposed by the weak language of thought hypothesis (Camp 2007).

Prominent proponents of the language of thought hypothesis, like Fodor and Pylyshyn (1988), are confident that it can be extended to explain not only the cognition and behavior of humans, but also the representational capacities of non-human animals. The reason they give in favor of this extension is that, like ours, the minds of non-human animals are systematic: their ability to produce some representations is intrinsically connected to their capacity to generate others. Thus, if they can think a thought like aRb, they must be able, at least in principle, to think the inherently related thought bRa. They acknowledge that this is, at bottom, an empirical matter, but they are prepared to bet that this is how animal minds are structured. They further contend that the only explanation on offer for such systematicity is the possession of a linguistically structured system of mental representations (see also Fodor 1975, 56-58, for additional considerations in favor of this thesis).

More recently, Quilty-Dunn et al. (2023) have argued that evidence from comparative cognition—in particular, evidence that several animal species can use abstract representations and engage in inferences using some logical operators— supports the hypothesis that many animal species possess representational systems with a language-like structure.[8] They admit, however, that such languages of thought probably exhibit variations from species to species (in their syntax, in their primitive components, in the logical operators or quantifiers that they include, etc.) and may share only some partially overlapping properties with the human language of thought. They also acknowledge that languages of thought likely co-exist among both human and non-human animals, alongside vehicles possessing other representational formats, such as mental maps, iconic representations and so on.

A few researchers working on animal cognition provide detailed discussions of empirical evidence suggesting that some animals possess a language of thought. For instance, primatologists Cheney and Seyfarth argue that baboons’ advanced cognitive abilities are supported by a language of thought. As they see it, the evidence they have collected through careful observations and experiments reveals that, at least in the social domain, the knowledge of baboons “constitutes a discrete, combinatorial system of representations—a language of thought—that shares several features with human language” (Cheney & Seyfarth 2007, 251).[9] According to these researchers, baboons can recognize the identities of individual members of their group and attribute several discrete-valued social properties to them (such as being a high-ranking or a low-ranking member of the group’s social hierarchy). Furthermore, they can combine their representations of individuals and properties to form propositionally structured contents. Like linguistic representations, baboons’ social representations are rule-governed and open-ended (these animals can represent, for instance, all kinds of dominance relationships among every member of their group). They are also hierarchically structured (baboons represent the relative ranks of whole families and the ranks of individuals within a family) and independent of sensory modality. Cheney and Seyfarth believe that the fact that baboons’ representations and human languages share all of these features suffices to conclude that their social knowledge is encoded in a language of thought.

Camp (2009b) argues against this view in two steps. Firstly, she claims that these features are not sufficient to make baboons’ cognition language-like, since other representational systems, such as maps and diagrams, can also exhibit them. Secondly, she points out that the capacity of baboons to represent states of affairs lacks the generality that a linguistic representational system allows. Therefore, she concludes that baboons probably employ a representational format that differs significantly from language.

Jacob Beck shares Camp’s doubts about attributing a language of thought, at least in its strong version, to non-human animals. He argues that since humans communicate in public languages and our linguistic emissions can be understood as direct translations of our internal thoughts, there are solid reasons to believe that we use a linguistic representational medium as the vehicle for our thinking. Non-human animals, by contrast, do not employ richly structured public languages to communicate, so there is no special reason to attribute a language of thought to them (Beck 2018). Moreover, the lack of such richly structured public languages poses a puzzle for those who believe animals possess a language of thought: why do they lack our kind of public language if their internal representational systems are so similar to ours (Camp 2009b)? It is often added that animal thoughts are less productive and systematic than human ones (if productive or systematic at all). These differences have led many researchers to believe that animals’ mental representations have a non-linguistic format.

When considering possible non-linguistic representational vehicles of animal thought, alternatives abound. Some philosophers claim that most (or all) animal representations have an iconic, pictorial, or imagistic structure. There are some key characteristics that differentiate iconic representations from linguistic or discursive representations. First, iconic representations represent something by bearing a (possibly abstract) relationship of resemblance or isomorphism to it. Second, iconic representations provide continuous information about a continuous spatial array, and each of its parts corresponds to a part of what it represents (unlike linguistic representations). Third, icons represent holistically, simultaneously encoding several properties of their referents, and they do not have a “canonical decomposition” into constituent units, with each unit representing a distinct property or particular (Bermúdez 2003; Shea 2024). Understanding animal representations as iconic appears to be particularly compatible with several deflationary accounts of animal thinking (see section 1), which restrict (most or all) animal cognition to what animals can perceive in their immediate environment (Bermúdez 2003). However, philosophers like Christopher Gauker (2018) take one step beyond and argue that we can posit imagistic (iconic) representations—including not only perceptions but also mental images and mental movies—to explain more complex and stimulus-independent capacities for problem-solving. Examples include those abilities displayed by monkeys and great apes when they use tools to acquire food in different experimental tasks.

A specific subtype of iconic representations, posited to account for some empirical evidence of animal behavior, is the class of analog magnitude representations. Many studies indicate that a wide range of animals, including mammals, birds, and fish, possess primitive systems for representing magnitudes (such as numerosities, durations, rates, distances, and sizes) without grasping units of measurement or number systems (Beck 2012b; 2018). As Beck highlights, animals’ magnitude discriminations are ratio sensitive; that is, their ability to discriminate between two magnitudes deteriorates as the ratio between them approaches 1:1. This phenomenon can be accounted for if we assume that magnitude representations have an analog format and involve some internal magnitude (for instance, a neural firing rate) that increases or decreases in proportion to the magnitude represented (e.g., the number of tones). The reason for this is that as the ratio of two external magnitudes approaches one, the ratio of the corresponding internal magnitudes does as well. Thus, it becomes increasingly difficult to differentiate between these internal magnitudes, which leads to discrimination errors between the external magnitudes they represent. In addition, since in such cases animals systematically fail to distinguish some magnitude representations from others, there are some recombinations of these representations that they are unable to make. Lastly, it is possible to accurately describe the manipulation or computation of analog magnitude representations without appealing to logical constants such as negation, disjunction, etc. Hence, these representations do not meet some of the crucial requirements (i.e., possessing a logical form and meeting the full-recombinability requirement) that one would expect to find in linguistic representations, at least as the strong language of thought hypothesis understands them (Beck 2012b; 2018).

It has also been argued that cartographic or map-like representations can help explain many animal behaviors. Researchers such as Camp (2007), Rescorla (2018), Aguilera (2016), and Boyle (2019) have defended variants of this view. According to Camp, cartographic systems are governed by their own formal principles and range from nearly pictorial to nearly diagrammatic, combining iconic, analog, and digital elements in several ways (Camp 2007, 2009b). Moreover, maps are complex representations composed of systematically recurring and recombinable elements, which use a spatial or geometric structure to represent both another spatial structure (Camp 2007) and some salient relations among the entities represented by the map (Rescorla 2018). Most frequently, the capacity to form cognitive maps has been proposed to explain animals’ abilities to navigate their environments (Tolman 1948; Boesch & Boesch 1984; Gould 1986; Camp 2007), but it has also been invoked to account for the mind-reading abilities of great apes (Boyle 2019) and at least some inferential capacities of other species (Rescorla 2009; Aguilera 2016).

As we have seen, in contemporary discussions, researchers have proposed different representational formats to explain non-human animals’ thinking and cognition. It is far from settled, however, which of them provides the best explanation of specific behavioral and cognitive capacities and which animal species represent things in one format or another. Furthermore, it remains an open question whether animals may use different representational formats to deal with tasks from different cognitive domains and which formats (if any) are exclusive of human thought.

5. Animal Reasoning

It is a widespread philosophical belief that thoughts not only fulfil a representational function but can also be used by their owners in various sorts of reasoning processes (Burge 2010; Shea 2024). Hence, when discussing animal thoughts, one should also consider animal reasoning. Many philosophers hold that genuine reasoning (and true rationality) can only be found in linguistic human animals (Davidson 1982 [2001]; McDowell 1996; Brandom 2000; Boghossian 2018). Nevertheless, other philosophers, as well as many comparative empirical researchers, claim that a number of animal species are capable of engaging in reasoning processes which allow them to respond adaptively to a variety of social and physical challenges, in particular when they face problematic situations and possess only incomplete, or contradictory information to solve them (Burge 2010; Völter & Call 2017; Rowlands 2019; Huber 2024).

As happens with many other philosophical debates related to animal thinking, it is possible to find both demanding and deflationary proposals on how to understand inferential reasoning. There is a liberal sense of inference used in cognitive psychology, according to which any information processing or any transition between informational states counts as inferential (Buckner 2019). Nevertheless, both philosophers and comparative psychologists working on animal cognition often lean towards more restrictive views. Very broadly, many of them characterize inferential reasoning, or rational inference, as a process consisting of reaching a conclusion from previously known or believed facts or evidence (Völter & Call 2017). These beliefs serve as premises providing the reasons that support the inference’s conclusion (Buckner 2019).

Comparative psychologists often attribute inferential reasoning to animals when they solve a problem spontaneously, flexibly, or even innovatively, based on partial or fragmentary information, or applying information acquired in one specific perceptual scenario to a perceptually different but conceptually similar situation. They often add that inferential reasoning involves combining perceived and imagined events, or connecting stimuli and responses despite substantial spatio-temporal gaps between them (Sabbatini & Visalberghi 2008; Völter & Call 2017; Call 2022). Arguably, when animals respond to problems in the way described, simpler explanations in terms of reflexes, instincts, or basic varieties of associative learning seem inadequate (Völter & Call 2017; Buckner 2019).

Many debates about animal reasoning revolve around what kinds of inferences different animal species may (or may not) be able to make. Researchers frequently ask whether animals can engage in practical or theoretical reasoning, whether their inferences are logically and deductively structured, and to what extent they can make causal inferences. In what follows, I briefly discuss each of these possibilities.

Let us begin with practical inferences. It has been argued that if we are willing to attribute reasoning capacities to animals, we should avoid over-intellectualizing rational inferences and rationality. According to Susan Hurley (2006), to accomplish this, we must stop taking the notion of domain-general, reflective, and conceptual theoretical reasoning (the kind of reasoning that allows a thinker to acquire a new piece of knowledge or a new belief) as our paradigm. Instead, she adds, we should focus on practical inferences, which are the thought transitions that animals use to determine what to do or how to act based on their beliefs and desires (Bermúdez 2006).[10] Unlike theoretical inferences, practical inferences do not necessarily require sophisticated intellectual abilities. Thus, non-human animals may display non-conceptual and context-bound capacities to make such inferences, by flexibly combining their means and ends in some ways, even if they lack fully-fledged conceptual and inferential abilities that can be applied to all kinds of domains. For example, evolution may have conferred on some animal species the capacity to make specific practical inferences in the social domain, which they cannot extrapolate to non-social domains (Hurley 2006).

Cameron Buckner (2019) proposes another deflationary approach to animal practical reasoning. According to it, the lowest forms of animal practical reasoning can be understood as processes through which animals categorize some things as being in some way—i.e., they categorize a prey in a specific situation as weak, or an object as adequate to solve a problem, etc.—and base their subsequent responses to problematic situations on these categorization judgments.[11]

Another strand of relatively recent philosophical and empirical work focuses on whether animals can engage in logical (deductive) reasoning. Generally speaking, this is a kind of reasoning through which thinkers reach a conclusion by applying logical rules (Rowlands 2019). It has also been claimed that such rules must necessarily operate upon representations with a linguistic structure and that they must involve the use of logical connectives and quantifiers (Bermúdez 2003; 2006). Some empirical studies provide evidence of animal reasoning processes that could be interpreted, at least prima facie, as logical inferences. As we will see, however, several other plausible explanations of this evidence have been offered. Consequently, whether animals can engage in these kinds of reasoning remains unresolved.

An experimental paradigm that some have interpreted as providing evidence of logical (deductive) reasoning focuses on exclusion tasks, such as the “cups task”. In the simplest version, subjects see how an experimenter hides food in one of two opaque cups. However, a barrier prevents them from detecting which cup is baited. A cup is subsequently revealed to be empty, and the subjects are allowed to choose between the two. The assumption is that, if the subjects solve the task by reasoning, they should use the information about the empty cup to exclude that location and select the other cup. Josep Call ran these experiments on great apes, who spontaneously solved the task (Call 2004, 2006). Similar findings were observed across several species, including various monkeys (Sabbatini & Visalberghi 2008; Petit et al. 2015), dwarf goats and sheep (Nawroth et al. 2014), domestic dogs (Erdőhegyi et al. 2007), elephants (Plotnik et al. 2014) and birds, such as ravens (Schloegl et al. 2009), New Caledonian crows (Jelbert et al. 2015), and African grey parrots (Mikolasch et al. 2011). Some researchers argue that the success of these species in these exclusion tasks indicates that they are reasoning deductively, specifically by engaging in a disjunctive syllogism, with the following structure:[12]

  1. A or B.
  2. Not A.
  3. Therefore, B.

This interpretation attributes demanding cognitive capacities to the experimental subjects. To engage in this form of syllogistic inference, animals must follow logical rules and possess some understanding of logical concepts like disjunction, negation, and the material conditional (Bermúdez 2006).

There are, however, other interpretations of the same empirical data that avoid attributing logical reasoning to animals. In one alternative reading, titled “Maybe A, maybe B”, the subjects initially believe that the reward might be in cup A or in cup B. When they later see that cup A is empty, they discard it and choose cup B, based on their initial premise that it is the other hiding location available and might contain the reward (Mody & Carey 2016).

A second alternative interpretation, articulated by Michael Rescorla, maintains that animals use cognitive maps to represent the possible locations of objects, assigning subjective probabilities to each of these objects being at specific locations, and updating those probabilities as new information is acquired. In the two-cups task, when animals initially see that the food item is hidden in one of the cups, they represent cups A and B as equally likely to contain food. Afterwards, when they see that cup A is empty, they raise the probability that food is in cup B, lower the probability that it is in cup A, and search for food in B, since it is the location most likely to contain food (Rescorla 2009; Beck 2018).

Yet another deflationary interpretation is offered by Bermúdez (2003, 2006). He begins by pointing out that to make inferences involving logical connectives, it is necessary to understand the relations between the truth values of their constituent thoughts. For example, understanding the thought “A or B” means grasping that either A is true or B is true. However, he adds, thinking about the truth value of a thought requires holding that thought in mind and treating it as the object of further thoughts; and this requires that such thoughts occur in a linguistic vehicle (Bermúdez 2006). Non-linguistic animals, then, are a priori ruled out as candidates for logical reasoning, and it becomes necessary to find an alternative explanation of empirical evidence like the one discussed above. Bermúdez suggests that animals succeed at experiments like the two-cups task by making proto-logical inferences. In these inferences, two proto-logical operators replace logical connectives: proto-negation and causal-conditionals. The basic claim is that some animals can use pairs of contrary concepts—like presence vs. absence, noise vs. silence, visible vs. invisible, etc.—as a variety of proto-negation, and represent causal relationships between events or states of affairs, or between actions and outcomes in terms of causal conditionals with the form “A causes B.” According to Bermúdez, armed with these two non-logical representational tools, they can succeed at the two-cups task.

A different debate in comparative psychology revolves around whether non-human animals can engage in causal reasoning. Researchers working on this topic typically take as their null hypothesis that animals can learn associations between different events, and they explore whether some of them also possess the more complex capacity to comprehend causal relationships and to use this understanding to make rational inferences about the causes of observed outcomes (Schloegl & Fischer 2017; Andrews & Monsó 2021).

Much of the discussion about animal causal reasoning hinges on how this notion should be understood. Penn, Povinelli, and colleagues hold that causal understanding involves a capacity for second-order relational reasoning that is uniquely human. For them, non-human animals can solve many problems by picking up and representing different first-order perceptual relations among particular objects and events in their environment, and by using that information to make inferences about how to reach their goals. To mention just one illustrative example, chimpanzees may learn that if they choose a rigid stick, they can use it to bring an out-of-reach piece of food closer, while this will not happen if they choose a flexible stick. Humans, by contrast, possess a more sophisticated representational system that enables them to re-interpret first-order perceptual relationships in terms of higher-order representational structures. This allows them to make causal inferences about abstract, unobservable properties (such as weight, solidity, and rigidity), to recognize structural similarities between perceptually different causal relations, to extrapolate their knowledge of causal relations to other contexts, etc. (Penn et al. 2008; Povinelli & Penn 2011).

Other researchers, however, contend that causal cognition is a complex phenomenon composed of several different abilities (Woodward 2011; Starzak & Gray 2021). Adopting this kind of gradualist view, Starzak and Gray distinguish three parameters of causal cognition, which may dissociate in various ways among different species. The first parameter concerns how animals acquire information about causal relations. Some animals may acquire causal knowledge in a causal-egocentric way, by personally manipulating objects and observing their effects (Papineau 2003; Woodward 2011). Other animals, however, may also learn in non-egocentric ways, by observing either the effects of other agents’ actions or the natural covariation between events. Empirical evidence suggests that egocentric causal learning is the most widespread alternative in the animal kingdom (Starzak & Gray 2021). The second parameter concerns how, and to what extent, creatures can integrate, update, and combine pieces of causal information from different sources (such as their own actions or the observation of external events). The final parameter relates to how implicit or explicit animal causal representations are. According to the authors, this taxonomy can help to investigate the nature of causal cognition, its evolution, and its development within and across species.

Seed et al. (2011) offer another gradualist account of causal cognition. While Penn, Povinelli, and their colleagues draw a dichotomy between first-order perceptual knowledge and abstract higher-order relational knowledge (which animals lack), Seed and colleagues distinguish three levels of increasing abstraction for representing causal information: the perceptual, the structural, and the symbolic levels. Animals that only possess perceptual knowledge approach problematic situations based on their superficial perceptual features. However, when they find a solution to a problem, they cannot generalize it to perceptually different contexts or to problematic situations requiring knowledge from other perceptual modalities. Animals capable of acquiring structural knowledge, by contrast, can encode some functional properties of objects and gain some understanding of their role in producing specific effects. This knowledge can be applied to perceptually distinct tasks or to tasks involving other perceptual modalities, as long as their causal logic remains unchanged. Finally, symbolic knowledge is abstract, arbitrary, and conceptual. The solutions achieved through this kind of knowledge can be transferred to a wide range of contexts, even those that share neither perceptual nor structural similarities with the original problem. These researchers conjecture that humans may be the only animals capable of symbolic, abstract knowledge. However, they also believe that we may find differences among non-human animals, between those that rely only on perceptual knowledge and those that can solve problems using structural information about causal properties (Seed et al. 2011).

Turning from these conceptual discussions to empirical studies, one standard test used to study causal reasoning is the trap task. In the original version of this task, the animals face a transparent tube with a trap in its center and an out-of-reach reward placed inside the tube next to the trap. The tested subjects are provided with a stick whose diameter is slightly smaller than the inner diameter of the tube. To solve the problem, they have to insert the stick into the tube and extract the reward away from the trap without pushing it into the trap. The initial performance of capuchin monkeys, chimpanzees, and woodpecker finches in this task was far from impressive: only a few subjects could solve it, and succesfull subjects often required intensive training (Limongelli et al. 1995; Visalberghi & Limongelli 1994; Tebbich & Bshary 2004; Seed et al. 2009). More relevantly, in cases where the tube was inverted and the trap was no longer functional, the monkeys still avoided it. These failures suggest that they have a poor understanding of the relevant cause-effect relationships and solved the task based on the perceptual features of the trap, just as Penn, Povinelli, and colleagues claim.

However, the results were significantly better in versions of the task in which the need to use a tool was eliminated (Seed et al. 2009), subjects could choose what actions to perform (pulling or pushing) (Martin-Ordas et al. 2008; Mulcahy & Call 2006b), the spatial disposition of the problem was altered (Martin-Ordas et al. 2008), or the subjects could select where to insert the tool (Girndt et al. 2008). Rooks and New Caledonian crows were also tested on a modified version of the trap tube task (the ‘‘two-trap tube’’ task). Seven out of eight rooks rapidly solved the task and transferred their solution accross a change in stimuli (however, only one of them succeeded on two further transfer tasks that shared no visual features with the original problem) (Seed et al. 2006). Additionally, three out of six New Caledonian crows could solve the two-trap tube, and then transferred that knowledge to a perceptually different trap-table task (Taylor et al. 2009). This suggests that at least some of these animals dealt with these tasks based on a structural, rather than a merely perceptual, representation of the situation.

Another line of research focuses on whether animals can infer the location of food by taking into account some causal properties of objects and how they can produce specific outcomes. In one of these studies, Hanus and Call (2008) presented chimpanzees with two opaque cups mounted on opposite sides of a balancing beam. In one condition, the experimenter hid a reward inside one of the cups (out of the subjects’ view). This caused the baited cup to move downwards and the empty cup to move upwards. Once this happened, the subjects could choose one of the cups. Chimpanzees preferentially inspected the cup on the lower side, suggesting that they understood that the inclination of the board was caused by the food item in the cup (see also Schloegl et al. 2013 for similar findings in long-tailed macaques). Relevantly, in a control condition, the experimenter tipped the balance. When this happened, the chimpanzees performed at chance level, which suggests that they did not base their choices on superficial perceptual information, such as the lower position of the cup, but rather on causal information regarding its weight (Hanus & Call 2008).

Based on these results, among others, Seed and colleagues (2011) conclude that some animal species, such as great apes and some birds, have (at least some) structural knowledge of causal properties and relationships. Sceptics about causal reasoning in non-human animals, however, present their own re-interpretations of this allegedly positive evidence (see, for instance, Povinelli & Penn 2011). It seems clear, then, that animal causal reasoning remains a controversial topic, and more work is needed to fill gaps in the existing evidence and obtain a deeper conceptual understanding of causal inferences and causal knowledge.

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