1. But see Clark 1996, Millikan 2004, Barrett 2011, and Siegel 2014 for more nuanced views that incorporate (deflated) representations in their reading of how animals perceive environmental affordances.

2. This also involves a notion of self (the traveler) and a sense of time (Suddendorf & Busby 2003).

3. Those who deny that non-human animals possess episodic memories propose alternative explanations of the available empirical evidence showing that they can use information acquired in the past, exhibit some sensitivity to how much time has elapsed since an event took place and so on. According to Hoerl and McCormack (2018), for instance, non-human animals can accomplish all these cognitive feats because they have a model of how things are in their environment, and as they receive new information incompatible with the old one, they erase the previous data and encode the new one. Therefore, their representations change over time, but all they have is an updated model of how things are at present. They cannot represent how things were at other times. Humans, in contrast, operate on a representational model of the world that includes a temporal dimension. As a result, they can represent events as occurring at different times, explicitly locating what happened in the past, the present, or the future. Redshaw (2014) argues, instead, that animals may have “uncontextualized” representations of events, which do not locate them in any specific temporal context. Finally, Keven (2016) claims that animals may possess perceptually based and “snapshot-like” event memories that, unlike episodic memories, are not organized into narratives with a causal structure.

4. In the last few decades, a number of novel approaches have focused on whether different animal species can satisfy additional behavioral indicators of episodic—or “episodic-like”—memory. I briefly mention here several relevant ones. Some researchers have argued that the distinctive characteristic of episodic memory is that it allows subjects to integrate information about what happened and where with contextual details that distinguish a particular remembered event from similar ones. There is evidence that rats show a capacity to integrate and remember this kind of contextual information about experienced events (Eacott & Norman 2004). Other researchers hold that a key feature of episodic memory is the capacity to remember the source or origin of information acquired in the past, and they have found evidence that rats (Crystal et al. 2013; Crystal 2021), rhesus monkeys (Basile & Hampton 2017) and cuttlefish (Billard et al. 2020) possess this specific capacity. Some have argued that a third distinctive marker of episodic memory is the ability to remember and replay a series of events in the specific order in which they took place. Again, some empirical results indicate that rats can do this (Panoz-Brown et al. 2018; Crystal 2021). Finally, another typical characteristic of human episodic memory is that it automatically encodes trivial or incidental information even if it is not known at the time of encoding whether that information will be useful in the future. Consequently, subjects capable of episodic memory can retrieve that information afterwards and use it to deal with an unexpected memory assessment. Based on these ideas, several researchers have tested different animal species in unexpected situations requiring the retrieval of incidental information about a specific event and found that pigeons (Zentall et al. 2001), rats (Zhou et al. 2012), dogs (Fugazza et al. 2016), Eurasian jays (Davies et al. 2024), and dolphins (Davies et al. 2022) succeed in this kind of task. All this converging evidence coming from different methodological approaches strengthens the hypothesis that some species of non-human animals possess episodic memory or at least something quite similar to it.

5. Sceptics, however, tend to provide lower-level explanations of these data. They claim, for example, that great apes’ success in choosing a tool that will be useful for a future task can be explained by associative learning, since the appropriate tools are reinforced during the training phases of these studies (Suddendorf & Corballis 2007; Suddendorf et al. 2009). Or, alternatively, they conjecture that seeing the tool might trigger an immediate representation of the reward it can help retrieve, allowing the apes to make their choice based on this immediate representation, rather than forming expectations of a specific future event in which the reward becomes available again (Suddendorf et al. 2009; Redshaw 2014; Redshaw & Bulley 2018).

6. Leaving aside overly restrictive views of animal thinking, several philosophers have provided gradual and nuanced accounts of what is required to possess concepts and have given reasons to attribute different kinds of concepts and conceptual abilities to non-human animals. Some examples of this kind of work can be found in Allen 1999, Glock 2000, Newen & Bartels 2007, Camp 2009a, Carruthers 2009, Nelson 2020, Monsó 2022, and Monsó & Danón 2024.

7. Burge (2010; 2022) thinks, however, that even though perception involves reference to particulars and attributions of properties to them, its contents are still non-propositional.

8. These authors, however, distance themselves from the strong claim that the representations in a language of thought must be structured like the sentences of a natural language. They propose, instead, an updated version of the language of thought hypothesis, according to which these representations are language-like only in some broad respects: they have discrete constituents corresponding to individuals and their separable features, they syntactically combine constituents in a way that maintains independence between syntactic roles and the constituents that fill them, they have a predicate-argument structure, they include logical operators, they exhibit inferential promiscuity, and some of their symbols encode abstract contents (Quilty-Dunn et al. 2023).

9. See also Tetzlaff & Rey 2009 for a defense of the idea that the best explanation of honeybees’ remarkable abilities to navigate and convey information about different resources to other bees through their “waggle dance” requires attributing a language of thought to them.

10. It should be noted, however, that comparative psychologists still often focus on theoretical inferences, at least if we understand them as thought transitions that enable animals to acquire new information and acknowledge that these non-human thinkers typically use this information to guide their practical actions in the short term.

11. See also Bermúdez 2003, Millikan 2006, and Hegarty 2025 for other interesting work on the topic of animal practical reasoning.

12. This is, for instance, the interpretation favored by Burge 2010 and Quilty-Dunn et al. 2023.