1. The appearance of a closer connection between causation and justice may reflect the use of the same moral baseline for determining both, i.e. the view that a disadvantage is caused by a social arrangement if and only if it would not have existed under a morally-privileged baseline—e.g. a state of nature or a collectivist utopia. If causation is assessed by the latter baseline, then any disadvantage caused by an existing social arrangement will be an injustice. But the use of such a baseline for determining causation or justice needs to be justified.

2. Profound intellectual and psychiatric impairments may also pose serious challenges for the medical model, in that many of those impairments may be difficult to understand as biomedical dysfunction or disease or to treat with biomedical interventions.

3. There is an alternative approach, as Cohen illustrates with his “doubly unfortunate person” (2011: 15–17). First, she is paraplegic and needs an expensive wheelchair, which egalitarians would provide regardless of her welfare level. Second, though she can move her arms well she suffers severe pain after moving them, so needs an expensive painkiller, which egalitarians would provide though this “cannot be represented as compensating for a resource incapacity”. Cohen concludes we need a metric – access to advantage – that takes account of both welfare and resources. However, we might think we can justify the provision of painkillers without reference to welfare: being unable to move our arms without pain implies we lack the real freedom or capability, and our entitlement to this need not be justified by the welfare it imparts (Begon 2023a: 118–123). Further, even if her welfare could be increased by some other means – the provision of a musical instrument, say – it seems we still have reason to respond to the pain, which again suggests that what matters is not simply someone’s overall welfare level.

4. The indexing problem also creates issues for prioritarian approaches if they adopt a metric with multiple measures of disadvantage, such as primary goods. To prioritise the ‘worst-off’ we must identify them, and so compare those who have different combinations of income, wealth, power, and authority (Arneson 1990).