Disability and Justice

First published Thu May 23, 2013; substantive revision Fri May 29, 2026

Among the topics in philosophy and disability, the relationship between disability and justice has received the lion’s share of attention. No doubt this is in part because justice, often regarded as the “first virtue of social institutions” (Rawls 1971: 3), is central to the evaluation of social policies and public institutions. However, although, disability is frequently referred to in the context of debates about justice, the problems that it raises are rarely unique: it is far from the only way people are disadvantaged, lack capacity, are excluded, marginalised, mistreated, or unjustifiably mistrusted. However, disability is nonetheless an important case to discuss in this context because it clearly illustrates what is at stake in many of the most central debates within theories of justice, and only by properly accommodating the case of disability can we identify a satisfactory theory of justice (Begon 2023a). Most often, disability has been seen as a paradigm example of the kind of unchosen disadvantage that a theory of distributive justice should respond to, and has been central in debates regarding the currency of justice, in particular. People with disabilities, particularly intellectual or cognitive disabilities, have also been seen as a ‘limit case’ for contractualist theories of justice. Hence, disability has played a central role in discussions about the eligibility conditions for being party to the contractual procedures by which principles of justice are chosen, and for being subject to the principles of justice so chosen.

Whilst mention of disability is frequent in discussions of social justice, then, only recently has the theoretical literature begun to take seriously the perspectives and arguments of disabled scholars and activists and treat disability as more than a convenient example of disadvantage, a form of incapacity or inability that should be ‘fixed’ if possible, and compensated for if not, or a test of our intuitions regarding who falls within the scope of justice. Whilst some theories of justice are ill-suited to account for a revised conception of disability – as a form of human variation which is poorly accommodated by current social norms and infrastructure, and frequently leads to mistreatment, exclusion, and distrust – other theories can adjust to this reconceptualisation much more naturally, as we will see.

This entry is organised as follows: Section 1 will examine the implications of different models of disability for justice, whilst Section 2 focuses on the distinction between redistribution and recognition. Sections 3, 4, and 5 examine the treatment of disability in contemporary theories of distributive justice. It will explain how the environmental and social character of disability has been largely overlooked by contractarian and egalitarian theories, not so much because of their distributive focus, but because of their narrow focus on one aspect of disability – functional limitation – to the neglect of exclusionary attitudes and practices. Recent efforts have sought to rectify this neglect, broadening the metric for just distributions to encompass respectful relationships and social practices, and focusing on modifying the physical and social environment not merely redistributing resources among individuals. Section 6 will discuss the relationship of disability identity to various approaches to justice. Finally, Section 7 will consider the epistemic injustices to which disabled people may be subject: the testimony of disabled individuals is often unduly distrusted and ignored, which can contribute to a failure to understand or acknowledge the diversity of disabled experiences, with negative and medicalised conceptions dominating the discourse, and making movements like Disability Pride hard to understand.

1. Models of Disability and Their Implications for Justice

‘Disability’ is typically defined in terms of two elements: (i) a physical or mental characteristic labelled or perceived as an impairment or dysfunction, and (ii) a significant personal or social limitation associated with that characteristic. The relationship between these two elements – and the role of the environment in mediating them – is a core issue in the conceptualisation of, and social response to, disability. The medical model sees the limitations faced by people with disabilities as resulting primarily or solely from their impairments. By contrast, the various social models see disability as a relationship between individuals and their social environments: physical and mental characteristics are limiting only or primarily in virtue of social practices that lead to the exclusion of people with those characteristics. This exclusion is manifested not only in deliberate segregation, but in built environments and social practices that restrict the participation of people regarded as having disabilities (see the entry on disability: definitions and models).

In their extreme forms, which treat the impairment or environment (respectively) as the sole cause of personal and social limitation, the medical and social models have few, if any, defenders. Rather, they mark the limits of possible relationships between impairment and limitation. Almost all writers on disability acknowledge some role for both the impairment and the environment in causing limitations, but disagree on their assessment of their comparative contribution and interaction. They disagree, too, on whether the limitations caused by impairments are constitutive of disability, or if limitations are only disabling when socially caused (e.g., Campbell and Stramondo 2017, Silvers 2003, the entry on disability: definitions and models). Nonetheless, most who embrace some version of the social model acknowledge that impairments – generally but not universally understood as deviations from species-relative statistical norms – can be sources of discomfort and limitation even in the absence of disadvantaging social practices (e.g., Shakespeare 2014a, Thomas 2004). They would argue, however, that such adverse effects are far less damaging than social exclusion, are greatly magnified by hostile environments, and could be significantly reduced by more inclusive environments. The medical model is less often explicitly defended than unreflectively adopted – by healthcare professionals, bioethicists, and philosophers who ignore or underestimate the contribution of social and other environmental factors to the limitations faced by people with disabilities (Koon (2022) is a recent exception). Even among these groups, however, there is a growing awareness of the environmental contribution to disability and a partial embrace of the social model (Cureton and Brownlee 2009).

Both models recognise that disability raises issues of justice, the difference lies in their judgement about the nature of that injustice and the solution deemed appropriate. For the medical model, the disadvantages perceived as inherent to disability may raise some of the most urgent claims of justice (Barclay 2011, 2018), but such a model does not recognise any principled rationale for preferring reconstruction of the social and built environment over compensation or ‘cures’ as a means for correcting disability-related disadvantage (e.g., Wolff 2009a,b). In contrast, the social model has been taken to support such a rationale, since it construes many aspects of disability-related disadvantage as essentially connected to various forms of literal and figurative exclusion. Of course, even if disadvantage is socially caused, individual or medical interventions may be the best, or only, feasible way to mitigate this disadvantage (Wasserman 2001; Samaha 2007; Barclay 2018, Wolff 2009a,b). Thus, there is no simple correlation between an account of how disability is caused and the most appropriate response to its disadvantages, though if social institutions contingently favour those who function atypically, justice may demand they compensate those who are thus disfavoured (Aas 2020, SEP entry on disability: definitions, models, experience).

Different versions of the social model emphasise different features of the exclusionary structures and practices (see the entry on disability: definitions and models). The minority group model regards people with impairments as a stigmatised minority group. It holds that the main reason people with disabilities encounter special hardships is that they face discrimination akin to that faced by racial or ethnic minorities (Hahn 1987, Oliver 1990). The human variation model holds that many of the challenges faced by disabled people do not result from deliberate exclusion, but from a mismatch between their characteristics and the physical and social environment (Scotch and Schriner 1997). These two versions of the social model differ mainly in emphasis. The discrimination stressed by the minority group model generally leads to, and is expressed in, the societal failure to accommodate people with stigmatised differences. Yet the failure to fully accommodate people who function atypically does not necessarily arise from stigma, though disparities in access that were initially caused by resource, or technological, limits are often maintained by stigma.

The social model has been criticised for focussing only on social causes (at the expense of internal impediments), and consequently of advocating only social solutions even when these seem insufficient (Barnes 2016; 2009; Terzi 2008). It is important that social causes are broadly construed to include a wide range of contextual factors: (a) services, systems, policies, and institutions; (b) norms and attitudes; (c) natural and material environment; (d) products and technology; and (e) support networks, relationships, and community (see Begon 2023a) – and not merely explicit exclusion, bias, or unjust treatment. Nonetheless, the limitations associated with many impairments cannot be reduced to the impact of context, however broadly construed. This is, perhaps, clearest in the case of intellectual and psychiatric impairments, as well as for complex and painful physical impairments such as fibromyalgia, multiple chemical sensitivity, and other conditions that radically and unpredictably affect energy, stamina, and functioning (Wendell 1989, 1996; Davis 2005). Thus, whilst it is often important to emphasise various external factors, this should not blind us to the diversity of causes of, and responses to, disadvantages associated with disability. Indeed, most social model theorists acknowledge this point, and emphasise the social primarily as a strategy to draw attention to contextual factors in response to the medical model’s narrative of ‘deficient’ bodies and minds (e.g., Terzi 2008, Shakespeare and Watson 2001, Shakespeare 2014b) – rather than really meaning that “disablement is nothing to do with the body” (Oliver 1996: 35).

Some critics also accuse social model theorists of assuming that any disadvantage caused by the social environment is unjust (Samaha 2007) or, that causes of disadvantage must be unjust to be disabling (Kahane and Savulescu 2009). However, the fact that social structures or practices cause disadvantage does not imply that there is a duty of justice to correct or compensate for the disadvantage. That will depend on the costs of alleviating it, and – under any plausible theory of justice – some comparison with the advantages and disadvantages that would result from alternative social arrangements. Sometimes this is a question of trade-offs. Thus, for example, choosing to spend the bulk of a municipal arts budget on a concert hall rather than an art museum may disadvantage those who cannot hear. But that disadvantage, and the social decisions that cause it, are not necessarily unjust. That will depend, inter alia, on the availability of non-auditory forms of aesthetic experience and the comparative costs of building the museum instead (Samaha 2007; Wasserman 2001; Begon 2017). In other cases, this is because we lack the technology or the resources to alter the social environment to mitigate disadvantage. For example, purchasing communications technology inaccessible to blind or deaf employees is not unjust if no alternative is available. However, this does not imply that the status quo and the boundaries of what is feasible should not be challenged. The failure to work to develop accessible software might itself be unjust, as would a failure to purchase modestly priced accessibility upgrades when available.

Conversely, the fact that social arrangements do not cause or contribute to a disadvantage does not insulate it from claims of justice; the failure to alleviate that disadvantage may be unjust on plausible accounts. Thus, although many ‘natural’ disasters like Hurricanes Katrina owe much of their destructive impact to social arrangements, it is plausible that the state’s duty to support the victims of hurricanes and tsunamis is not contingent on its responsibility for causing or exacerbating them (Wasserman 2001).[1] On some views, the failure to assist and resulting disadvantage will only be unjust if providing assistance is feasible: that the social environment can be modified in ways that alleviate the disadvantages associated with impairment is what places demands for their alleviation within the scope of justice. If we reject this ‘feasibility constraint’ on justice – the claim that the demands of justice must be realisable – then disadvantages may be unjust even if they cannot be rectified, and so no agent is acting unjustly (see Cohen 2008; Gheaus 2013; Gilabert and Lawford-Smith 2012). This is presupposed in the above example, where it seems blind or deaf employees are subject to unjust disadvantages even if we assume the lack of accessible software is unavoidable, not the result of unjust action.

This is significant given that the inclusive environment demanded by human variation models cannot be fully achieved (Barclay 2010, 2018, Shakespeare 2014a). The variation in individual needs and potential conflicts between them makes this an intractable problem: 1) for many characteristics, from height to mathematical aptitude, one ‘size’ does not fit all; 2) providing different sizes increases fit for a wider range of variation, but at increasing cost (albeit less than often assumed); and 3) it is frequently impractical, and may arguably be unjust, to ensure that everyone is equally well-or ill-fitted – it may, for example, be too expensive to ensure that left-handed or extremely tall individuals suffer no inconvenience in being statistical minorities. Full inclusion, like universal design, is an ideal – one that cannot be fully achieved, and that must be compromised in the partial satisfaction of other legitimate claims.

However, even if it would be impossible or unreasonable to achieve full inclusion through wholesale changes in the physical or social environment, in many areas modest changes can significantly increase inclusion at little cost. For example, some people with autism face significant barriers to taking part in routine social activities: they find such familiar stimuli as applause, light touching, and deodorant highly aversive; they must be explicitly instructed about social expectations because they cannot “read” most facial expressions or social clues (Owren 2013). The “neurotypical majority” cannot be expected to give up applause, light touching, or even deodorant, let alone nuance in communication (Owren 2013: 23–24), but strategies are still available to enhance accessibility and reduce sensory issues without unduly burdening the majority (Lim 2015). Thus, the claim that it is impossible to achieve, or even understand, full inclusion for people with autism does not deny that there is significant injustice in their current state of social isolation.

2. Recognition, Redistribution, and Reasonable Accommodation

People with disabilities have long been treated as moral and social inferiors, whilst also suffering distributive injustices of various kinds. Routinely, people with disabilities have been denied jobs for which they are highly qualified because they have been considered incompetent, or because employers have not been comfortable with their presence in the workplace. Often, people with certain disabilities have been consigned to segregated institutions and facilities because they have been regarded as incapable of making decisions or caring for themselves, or because others in the community did not want to interact with them. These forms of relational injustice are associated with very concrete material inequalities. Thus, disabled individuals are subject to both distributive injustices – unjustified lack of resources or opportunities – and relational injustice – unjust treatment of some as moral, social, or political inferiors on the basis of morally irrelevant characteristics (Fourie et al. 2015; Anderson 1999; Fraser 2001, 1996; Honneth 1992).

In these respects, people with disabilities are in a comparable position to members of other ‘discrete and insular minorities’ with a history of being subject to both distributive and relational injustice. But there is a significant difference: whilst there is no reason to think eliminating disrespect and misrecognition towards racial, ethnic, and sexual minorities need be expensive, insofar as eliminating disrespect and misrecognition towards people with disabilities requires accommodation and reconstruction of the built environment, it may come at significantly greater cost. These costs need not be understood as compensation for the alleged deficits of people with disabilities, but accommodation of human variation (Stramondo 2020). Indeed, such costs would have to be acknowledged even if disabilities were seen as intrinsically neutral physical or mental characteristics that merely differ from those of the majority. In any society whose physical structures and social practices are designed for average or typical members, people with disabilities will be disadvantaged just because of their minority status. A similar point has been made by feminist scholars, who have pointed out the structural discrimination of workplaces and public settings designed exclusively for men. The expenses of additional restrooms, stalls, or pumping stations do not compensate women for their deficiencies. They simply accommodate differences ignored in a society that saw a woman’s place as in the home (Wendell 1996; Wasserman 1998: 178–179).

The conceptualisation of disadvantages associated with disability is also of expressive significance (Aas 2021; Putnam 2018). Pogge (2002) and Anderson (1999) have claimed that it is disrespectful to attribute a person’s disadvantage to features of their natural endowment because it treats them as needy, deficient, or inferior. Thus, they argue redistributive measures should be justified as redressing discrimination, not correcting natural inequalities. Yet as Barclay (2010, 2018) points out, such claims need only recognise that some traits are less suited than others for specific environments – a contingency that does not imply the intrinsic superiority or inferiority of a given endowment. Thus, we can question the assumption that certain characteristics or traits are universally valuable, such that an individual who lacked them would be deficient in any environment (e.g, Buchanan et al. 2000; Daniels 1985; Kahane and Savulescu 2012; McMahan 2005, and, e.g., Barnes 2016; Begon 2023a; Campbell and Stramondo 2017; Reynolds 2017; Stramondo 2017, for those who dispute this). Instead, we can simply acknowledge that if inclusion requires maximising individuals’ environmental fit, this may require expending more resources for some than others in any given environment, but this does not presuppose their inferiority, only their minority status. The same would be true of very tall or left-handed people, suggesting that the demands for accommodation of people with such statistically atypical features differ merely in degree, not kind, from those made by people with various impairments.

Of course, even if compensation for disadvantage need not be demeaning, specific laws and policies may be, for example, if they compensate people simply because they are disabled, or have a specific disability. Compensation that is based on the medical classification of disability may reinforce the humanity-obscuring stereotype of ‘the cripple’ as helpless and pitiable (Putnam 2018). This grave threat to social equality should make us wary of drawing distributive implications from the claim that disability is a ‘bad difference’ rather than a ‘mere difference’, even if disability in general, or specific disabilities, were bad differences (see SEP entry on Disability: Well-Being, Health, and Personal Relationships).

Indeed, the understanding of what is owed to disabled individuals as recognising and accommodating difference (not compensating for deficiency) is reflected in the ‘reasonable accommodation’ requirement found in much legislation, including the ADA and ADAAA. The failure to make reasonable accommodation for disabled employees or users of public facilities, such as ramps, elevators, texts in multiple formats, sign-language interpreters, flexible work schedules, and job coaches or assistance, is with some notable exceptions, taken to constitute discrimination not lack of compensation (ADA 1990, see Crossley 2004; Karlan and Rutherglen 1996). Just as the expense of accommodating religious practices is not regarded as compensating religions for their deficits, but as meeting the requirement for states to treat religions and their adherents with equal respect and concern (Dworkin 2003). With respect to both groups, substantive equality of concern, and enabling social participation, may require unequal provisions.

However, the rectification of such structural discrimination may raise more difficult issues for people with disabilities given the uncertainty and potential for disagreement about the extent of the changes required to treat people with disabilities as social and political equals. Indeed, the range and variety of physical and mental differences within a society raise issues of distributive justice that have no obvious analogue for other stigmatised groups insofar as relational justice for people with disabilities may require diverting significant resources from other causes. Unlike a ‘gender-neutral’ environment, what it would mean to achieve an ‘ability-neutral’ environment – one no more advantageous to people with some physical and mental characteristics than others – has not been specified, and may be either conceptually incoherent or prohibitively expensive. Moreover, it seems likely that questions about the extent to which justice requires reconstructing or modifying the built environment would arise even in a society with no history of invidious attitudes or practices toward such persons. By contrast, it seems less likely that such questions would arise in a society with no history of sexism, for example. The legislative understanding of accommodation as a matter of distributive justice is reflected in the qualifying use of ‘reasonable’ and the exemption of accommodations that would impose an ‘undue’ burden or hardship on the entity required to make accommodations (Wasserman 1998). This leaves indeterminate the answer to how much additional provision is required for disabled individuals, reflecting a complex mix of claims concerning redistribution and recognition. For example, is it sufficient to offer the cost-effective option of providing wheelchair access to restaurants through the service entrance? Or does this treat wheelchair users as second-class customers – a claim of misrecognition? It may often be difficult to sharply distinguish claims for redistribution and recognition: recognition may require redistribution, redistribution should aim at securing recognition, and unjust distribution can be disrespectful or discriminatory (Wasserman and Aas 2017; Putnam 2018).

Disability thus illustrates how the goals of relational and distributive justice can be complementary, yet also conflict when cost or feasibility makes providing the inclusive environment social models demand hard to meet. This challenge is perhaps greatest for cognitive and psychiatric impairments. Not only do these evoke some of the strongest prejudice and present some of the most difficult functional limitations – e.g., on the capacities to engage in practical reasoning, to recognise the intentions and attitudes of other people, or to participate in shared activities – they also present a significant practical challenge, because the measures required for greater inclusion are not as concrete or tangible, and may demand greater imagination to envision and implement.[2] Although significant practical work has been done on educational and workplace inclusion, philosophers have been daunted by the challenge of social reconstruction for significant cognitive impairments. Thus Jonathan Wolff (2009a: 407), who generally favours such reconstruction – which he calls ‘status enhancement’ – as the most respectful intervention, asks

What would it mean to change the world so that people with cognitive disabilities and other people were equally able to find a worthwhile place in the world? Can we even imagine what this would be?

Many rights and privileges are thought to require a certain level of cognitive capacity, e.g., the right to vote or contract (Wikler 1979). Similarly, most jobs are structured to require regular hours, uninterrupted activity, undivided attention, and general sociability. How much should a society modify these requirements or restructure these activities to include people with various intellectual, psychiatric, and complex physical disabilities? A total relaxation of such requirements would impose large, even ‘unduly burdensome’ costs. However, many modifications to promote the inclusion of people with significant cognitive impairments would also benefit people with typical cognitive function: simplified task explanations, warning labels, news copy, and jury instructions. Many accommodations employers are already making to increase flexibility and reduce stress, from individually-tailored schedules to remote working, would ease the entry of people with these disabilities into the workplace (e.g., Biklen 1992; Block 2006; Connor et al. 2008; Hehir 2002).

As discussed below, there is sharp disagreement about whether individuals with the most severe intellectual impairments qualify as subjects of justice. But even if they do, what justice demands for them, and of them, may be uncertain or disputed. Nussbaum (2009) contends that the equal citizenship of those individuals requires that they be enabled to exercise such political rights as voting and jury service through appropriate surrogates. Wasserman and McMahan (2012) question whether those rights could be meaningfully exercised by surrogates for individuals with the most severe intellectual disabilities. Barclay (2018) argues equal status requires the extension of the franchise to all people in with cognitive impairments, in light of the costs of identifying and excluding some individuals. However, she acknowledges that this cost-benefit analysis approach does not rule out capacity-testing in other areas, and such pessimism about the possibility of full inclusion is widely-shared. (Exceptions include Kittay and Carlson 2010; Hartley 2009a; Silvers and Francis 2009; Wong 2007, 2009.) Wolff (2009a: 407) cites Wikler (1979) in stating,

the fact is that what makes much of modern life possible now relies on binding and enforceable contracts that in turn assume a certain level of intellectual competence. To change the world so that such a bar is lowered would have tremendous costs.

Thus, for cognitive disabilities, Wolff (2009a: 407–413) emphasises “targeted resource enhancement” rather than status enhancement, arguing for an entitlement scheme that gives people with cognitive disabilities maximum possible control over an individual budget for personal assistance and social support. Wolff (2009a: 413) does regard some forms of status enhancement, notably antidiscrimination measures, “as essential”, but accepts Wikler’s conclusion that broader changes in social practice carry “intolerable costs”. A view shared by Buchanan et al. (2000) who compare the reconstruction of society for greater inclusion with a family decision to play only the card games that a young child can understand. They contend that just as adults will tire of Go Fish, society will be ‘dumbed down’ if it refashions itself to fully include people with cognitive impairments.

Although the meaning of inclusion is debatable, and different forms of inclusion will have differing value for different people, the card-game analogy oversimplifies the challenge. To present inclusion as a zero-sum allocation is to dumb down the incredibly complex task of rearranging society to respect and nurture all its members. The analogy falsely assumes that every activity must be done by everyone. A more apt analogy might be an assortment of games: some could be played by everyone; others could be modified to include cognitively impaired people in a way that preserves the interest of non-disabled players; some would be beyond the reach of people with certain cognitive impairments. But even the most cognitively-gifted individuals could not participate in all games – the sheer amount of training and practice required to master some of them, and the considerable time and energy many of them require, would preclude participation in many or most. Indeed, society may function better if people have varying aptitudes for, and interests in, different activities (see Wong 2007). The fact that a smaller set of activities may be available to people with cognitive impairments need not present a problem, if it does not result in their social isolation or deny them intellectual challenges, or undermine their equal status (Parens & Asch 2000; Barclay 2018). Thus, whilst ensuring their inclusion may require society to refashion itself in significant ways, this need not entail excessive costs. For example, individuals with significant cognitive impairments need not be able to make binding contracts in every domain of law and business, and competence standards may be graduated to reflect the complexity of specific tasks so that those individuals are not categorically excluded. Impairments – physical as well as cognitive – differ from skin colour in that they are sometimes relevant to what people can do, but that hardly precludes social reconstruction.

3. Disability and Contemporary Social Contract Theories

The resurgence of philosophical interest in justice is often dated to the publication of John Rawls’ A Theory of Justice in 1971. Although that was only two years before the passage of the Rehabilitation Act of 1973, embodying a social model of disability, it was well before the academic reconceptualisation of disability as a social phenomenon. For the 25 years after A Theory of Justice, many justice theorists tacitly accepted the medical model (e.g., Dworkin 2000; Daniels 1985). They treated disability as a physical or mental limitation of the individual, the principal cause of disability-related disadvantage. Indeed, the medicalisation and exclusion of those with (cognitive) disabilities can be traced at least to Locke (Clifford Simplican 2015; Arneil 2009). Disability thus posed a problem for justice theories based on mutual advantage, hypothetical agreement, or material or social equality. People with disabilities did not appear to offer reciprocal advantages; they complicated the task of reaching a hypothetical agreement on the basic structure of society; and they made the goal of equality seem impossibly demanding. By the late 1990s, some mainstream political philosophers were becoming acquainted with social models of disability, and sought to modify distributive theories of justice to take account of the social and environmental character of disability (Nussbaum 2006a; Wolff 2009a); others cited the failure of those theories to take appropriate account of disability as one reason to reject exclusively distributive approaches (Kittay 1999).

Before describing these developments, it is useful to distinguish two types of distributive theories. Modern social contract theories (e.g., Rawls 1971; Dworkin 2000), seek to determine the fair terms of social cooperation to which individuals, generally with limited knowledge of their own situation, would agree; they argue that certain distributive principles, such as Rawls’s ‘difference principle’, would be among those terms. Rawlsian theories are procedural in one sense: they regard any distribution as just if and only if it is consistent with the distributive principles that would be chosen by those individuals. Disability-oriented criticism of these theories has focused on their assumptions about the individuals who are eligible to make a hypothetical contract or participate in the cooperative scheme it establishes. Critics have argued for the eligibility of people with disabilities or their representatives to participate in the contract-making processes and resulting cooperative scheme more than about the validity of the principles or rules yielded by that process (Richardson 2006; Silvers and Francis 2005; Stark 2007). The second type of theory is primarily interested in outcomes, and here, disability-informed criticism has favoured outcome metrics that account for the social contribution to disability-related disadvantage, and the significance of disrespectful inequalities (Anderson 1999; Nussbaum 2006a; Wolff 2009b, see §4).

Within social contract theories, a distinction is often drawn between contractarian/Hobbesian and contractualist/Kantian/Rawlsian accounts (see the entry on contractarianism). One way to characterise this distinction is in terms of the parties’ motivation and interaction. In the former, they are primarily self-interested and hard-bargaining; in the latter, their self-interest is tempered or balanced by their commitment to justifying themselves to others, and they proceed by deliberating rather than by bargaining. This distinction is often formulated in terms of a distinction between (merely) rational agents, and ‘reasonable’ agents.

A Rawlsian approach might seem more congenial than a Hobbesian approach to people with disabilities. It derives the basic structure of society from a hypothetical choice situation, the Original Position, in which a veil of ignorance precludes reliance on the contractors’ actual limitations – limitations that a Hobbesian contractor might ruthlessly (albeit rationally, if not reasonably) exploit. Although the parties themselves are motivated exclusively by considerations of self-interest, which Rawls understands in terms of the fulfilment of two higher-order interests (see the entry on the original position), the informational constraints of the Original Position compel the parties to motivate as if they are reasonable, at least in the sense that it compels them to be impartial between the claims of all who will be subject to the principles they choose.

But even if Rawlsian contractors do not know their specific limitations, they do know that they, or the individuals they represent, are not permanently disabled. Rawls stipulated that the idealised society whose ‘basic structure’ was the subject of hypothetical agreement was restricted to members who would be ‘fully-cooperating’ over the course of their adult lives. Rawls assumed that this restriction would exclude people with severe and permanent physical and mental disabilities (Rawls 1993: 18–20). He did not defend that assumption, nor provide for the representation of those people in the process by which the basic structure of society is to be determined. Instead, he consigned their fate to the later, legislative phase. Rawls also restricted participation in the Original Position to those with two ‘moral powers’: the capacity to form and revise one’s own conception of the good; and the capacity for a sense of justice, the capacity to act on and apply fair terms of cooperation (ibid.). It is doubtful that these powers can be attributed to people with the most severe intellectual and psychiatric impairments, although some have argued that a just society should treat all human beings as having the potential to develop such functioning (Wong 2007, 2009).

Disability scholars have been particularly critical of these eligibility conditions. If the deliberators in the Original Position do not believe that they could be representing, or could turn out to actually be, people with ‘severe and permanent’ disabilities when the veil is lifted, they will have no prudential reason to choose a basic structure for their society that will provide for the inclusion of those people. Indeed, insofar as such measures would impose costs on people with non-disabilities, the parties will have prudential reasons not to support such measures, since doing so would undermine the interests of people whom they know they could represent (the able-bodied on whom the costs are imposed) for the sake of those whom they explicitly know they don’t represent (the disabled for whom the costs are imposed).

Several philosophers sympathetic to the Rawlsian framework have suggested modifications that would give people with disabilities a greater and more direct role in the social contracting process. Some have argued that the ‘full cooperation’ requirement, and the kind of reciprocity it involves, can be liberally interpreted so as not to exclude most people with significant physical disabilities (Hartley 2009b, 2014; Stark 2009; Aas 2019; Lister 2013). For example, Sean Aas argues that if contributions are understood as compliance with basic social institutions then many seriously disabled people can make them. Henry Richardson (2006: 427) has gone even further, maintaining that Rawls’ arguments making use of the Original Position “do not essentially depend on any reciprocity premise”. He contends that without the assumption that no one has severe and permanent disabilities, the Original Position can yield principles more sensitive to disability concerns about the continuous nature of abilities, the stigmatisation resulting from false dichotomisation, and the exclusion of severely disabled human beings. In response, Martha Nussbaum (2006b: 490–498) concedes that Richardson’s proposal largely avoids the exclusionary features of the Original Position, but that this reconstruction is a more radical departure from Rawls than Richardson acknowledges. She suggests that the theory loses its contractual character if it dispenses with the reciprocity requirement and the assumption that the contractors have roughly equal physical and mental powers.

Rawls’s ‘moral powers’ condition has posed further problems. Harry Brighouse (2001) observes that modifying the cooperation requirement still excludes those whose cognitive impairments preclude their possession of the two moral powers. Sophia Wong (2009, 2007) argues that those powers can be acquired by people with severe intellectual impairments, with adequate social support. Leslie Francis (2009) and Anita Silvers (Silvers and Francis 2009) contend that many individuals with severe cognitive impairments can collaborate with others to construct individualised, authentic conceptions of the good. Silvers and Francis (2005) and Christie Hartley (2009a) also maintain that people with severe intellectual impairments can be represented adequately in a contracting process that consists in trust-building more than hard-bargaining, even if they cannot participate in it personally.

Others have argued that exclusion from the Original Position need not adversely affect people with disabilities or treat them with disrespect. Adam Cureton (2008) argues that the exclusion of people with severe disabilities from the Original Position is just part of its idealisation and does not diminish the urgency or priority of their claims. Cynthia Stark (2007) proposes lifting the full-cooperation requirement to include people with disabilities at the second stage of Rawlsian deliberation, where the society’s constitution is established and where the hypothetical decision-makers acquire some knowledge about the resources, development level, and other characteristics of their society.

The plausibility of these responses to Rawls depends to some extent on which version of the Original Position we consider. Rawls’s change to his presentation of the Original Position in his Restatement (2001) is especially pertinent to people with cognitive disabilities. He emphasised that the participants in the Original Position are representatives of people in the future society, not people living in the future society denied knowledge of their social position. If representatives were made to take into account the possibility that those they represent might be disabled, this might help to ensure that the interests of the disabled were represented. However, though we can, in principle, imbue any degree of knowledge or imaginative capacity to hypothetical contractors, this cannot simply be conferred on the philosophers using this device, and we may question their ability to imagine the very different embodiments of people with a variety of disabilities, just as feminist critics of Rawls questioned the imaginative abilities of men representing women (Young 1990; Benhabib 1992; Okin 1994). The strictly representational role of participants in the Original Position would also avoid the conflict of interest faced by cognitively unimpaired individuals representing themselves and cognitively impaired individuals.

More broadly, philosophers have varied widely in their optimism about the prospects for including people with disabilities in contractarian or contractualist deliberations. On the one hand, Lawrence Becker (2005) suggests that even selfish, hard-bargaining contractarians (his “tough crowd”) would accept an expansive notion of reciprocity, one that would ensure adequate provision for people with disabilities in the scheme of social cooperation they adopt. Their acceptance of reciprocity would arise from recognition of the needs and vulnerabilities they and their loved ones have or will likely acquire.

Even for the tough crowd, health is now ripe for inclusion in the list of basic goods. And it may be that a robust social commitment to health will address questions of justice for the disabled—as long as we are careful to include fundamental aspects of psychological health (i.e. those associated with active rational agency…. (2005: 35)

Members of the tough crowd may not be so careful, however. Indeed, some may not even regard “active rational agency” as a matter of health as they more narrowly construe it, with an emphasis on physical survival and comfort. In contrast to Becker, Eva Kittay (1999) holds that even the most liberal interpretation of Rawls’ scheme will not be sufficiently responsive to the egalitarian concerns that motivate his theory. Rawls’s assumption that the participants in the Original Position are or represent fully productive members of society neglects the fact of pervasive, inevitable human dependency (also see Arneil 2009). “[T]hose within relationships of dependency fall outside the conceptual perimeters of Rawls’s egalitarianism” (Kittay 1999: 79).

Another debate within contractarian theories that has particular relevance to disability concerns the scope of justice itself: is justice concerned only with the distribution of social goods, or also with the rectification of “natural inequalities” (Pogge 1989: 44–47)? Pogge (1995) argues that in the Original Position, it would be irrational for parties to ignore the contribution of natural advantages to the well-being (understood in terms of the fulfilment of the two “higher-order interests”) of prospective citizens, since from that standpoint, it is just as bad to be disadvantaged by uncompensated disabilities as by a small share of social primary goods. But Pogge claims that attempting to eliminate those inequalities would go beyond the scope of justice. Some philosophers argue, however, that many natural inequalities are within the scope of justice, and that health care to mitigate them is a requirement of justice (Daniels 1985; Buchanan et al. 2000).

Others would deny that the inequalities associated with impairments can be regarded as natural (Amundson 1992; Wasserman 2001; Aas and Wasserman 2016).More broadly, others question whether it is possible to draw a coherent distinction between natural and artificial or social inequalities (see Lippert-Rasmussen 2004; Nagel 1997; Pogge 2004a,b; Aas and Wasserman 2016). It may be tempting to respond to such claims by invoking a state of nature as a baseline for assessing which disadvantages are natural. The thought is that if we ‘subtract away’ society’s contribution to disadvantage, which is manmade, then we are left with the contribution of impairment alone, which is ‘natural’. But states of nature are artificial constructs, and the conclusions yielded by their examination largely depend on the features built into them. Proponents of a medical model of disability might invoke a Hobbesian state of nature, wherein people who are missing limbs or senses would be at a fatal disadvantage in the war of all against all. It should be apparent that such a state of nature is not merely a fiction, but an implausible one. Yet even if we focus on our actual hunter-gatherer past there is no reason to believe that what was disadvantageous in our evolutionary past will be so now (Barnes 2023: 35–37), or that we should use this as a baseline for assessing the causal role of impairments in disadvantages faced in the current context. Thus, whether it is possible to distinguish natural and social inequalities remains contentious, and even if such a distinction can be plausibly drawn, it may turn out that many or most inequalities in abilities are artificial: as with obsolete skills, those inequalities may be largely attributable to the physical and social environment (Bickenbach 1993).

4. Disability and the Currency of Justice

Other distributive theories are more directly concerned with the kinds of outcomes a just society should pursue. The implications of outcome-oriented theories for disability depend on two features of those theories. The first is the metric, or ‘currency’ of justice they adopt – welfare, resources, or capabilities. The second is the distributive standard they impose – equality, priority for the worst-off, or some minimum for everyone – as well as the degree to which outcomes should be sensitive to responsibility and luck. We will consider these two features in order, although they are sometimes intertwined (see the entry on distributive justice).

Some approaches measure just outcomes, at least in part, in terms of the welfare, or opportunities for welfare they generate (Arneson 1989, 2000, 2006, 2010; Vallentyne 2005, 2006, Cohen 1993, 1994, 2011). Insofar as such accounts aim to secure (the opportunity for) welfare for all, regardless of internal or environmental impediments, they may seem well-placed to respond to disability. However, two prominent criticisms of welfarist approaches are particularly relevant in the context of disability. First, insofar as a subjective measure of welfare is adopted, the approach is vulnerable to the problem of adaptive preferences: if individuals adapt to, and are thus satisfied with, mistreatment, exclusion, and deprivation, justice may not require their elimination (Sen 1988, Khader 2011, Terlazzo 2016). Whilst there is no reason to think disabled individuals are unusually prone to irrationality in their preference formation, they are often subject to unjust treatment, thus the ordinary process of adaptation can lead to apparent satisfaction with the unjust status quo – as for other mistreated minorities (Begon 2015, 2020). They are also frequently mistrusted and considered unreliable (as §7 considers in relation to epistemic injustice).

Second, disability is prominent in Dworkin’s arguments that welfarists do not provide assistance for the right reasons. For example, he points out that “[m]any people with serious handicaps have high levels of welfare on any conception – higher than many others who are not handicapped” (Dworkin 2000: 60). Yet this does not seem to make a difference to individuals’ entitlements: we do not think Tiny Tim’s cheerfulness undermines his claim to state accommodation (nor, indeed, his satisfaction, or access to important components of the good, such as family life and social relationships). Similarly, we might be reluctant for the state to purchase someone an expensive musical instrument rather than mobility equipment to allow them to be independently mobile, regardless of whether the former would improve their welfare more (Dworkin 2000: 61–62). The thought that some deprivations “express greater disrespect than others, in ways any reasonable person can recognize” (Anderson 1999: 332) is widely shared. It relies on a fundamental rejection of the welfarist view that justice demands that people achieve some degree of (opportunity for) welfare, and thus anything that could potentially enhance the quality of an individual’s life is within the scope of justice and that all that matters is that we reach some level of (opportunity for) welfare and not how this is reached.[3]

Rejecting welfarism, then, involves rejecting the assumption that “justice is concerned with the opportunities for a good life” (Vallentyne 2006: 82), and instead acknowledging a distinction between what we are entitled to from the state (e.g., central capabilities, primary goods, human rights) and what we might want (Scanlon 1975). It involves accepting, too, that what we are entitled to does not depend on its contribution to individual welfare, meaning some opportunities (or goods, or rights) cannot be exchanged for others as long as some overall level of welfare is achieved. Dworkin is not alone in using disability as a core example of an especially serious deprivation in this context. Whilst we might question the assumptions about the badness of disability, it does seem that the demands of justice should not depend on how disabled individuals feel about their circumstances.

A second group of views focus on ensuring individuals have access to resources of some form. Rawls’s use of ‘social primary goods’ as a metric for assessing comparative advantage is the best known. These include opportunities, basic liberties, income, and the social bases of self-respect, and are construed as ‘all-purpose means’ that are valuable to have irrespective of the content of one’s particular conception of the good. This breadth is intended to achieve neutrality between competing substantive conceptions of the good. The central objection to resourcism concerns its lack of sensitivity to “internal individual differences, and environmental features and social norms that interact with these differences” (Anderson 2010: 87). Resources may be valuable means to our particular ends, but the value that can be derived from these opportunities vary widely. Thus, focussing on the resources individuals have access to will be a poor proxy for determining the kinds of lives they are actually able to lead. Sen (1999; 1992; 1990) called the internal, personal factors governing the conversion of goods into opportunities ‘conversion capacities’, and later scholars increased the scope to incorporate the impact of external social and environmental features too (Crocker and Robeyns 2010; Robeyns 2017). Disability is, again, the go-to example to illustrate this point, but everyone’s opportunities are influenced by their personal features, policies and norms, the physical environment, the level of medical and technological development, or the support networks they can draw on – as well as their access to resources.

The internal resourcist response to this worry diagnoses the problem as being with the kinds of resources focused on. Specifically, identifying the worst-off solely on the basis of their possession of social primary goods (or impersonal resources) at the expense of calculating their share of natural primary goods (or personal resources), like health, intelligence, imagination, and talents, which are affected by social institutions but not directly distributed by them (Kymlicka 2002). Dworkin provides the most well-developed account that includes both. Dworkin (2000: 286) argues differences in personal resources should be “erased or mitigated” by providing those who are deficient in personal resources, such as “people who are physically handicapped or otherwise unable to earn a satisfactory income”, with additional impersonal resources. However, first, this approach assumes an individualised approach, with an implicit endorsement of the medical model. As such, this approach fails to account for the importance of contextual factors, sees disabled individuals as problems to be fixed, and the solution as changing them, or giving them more resources, rather than altering the environment. Additionally, insofar at the amount of impersonal resource compensation offered for personal resource ‘deficits’ is determined by the rate at which able-bodied people would be willing to insure themselves against the prospect of incurring that disability, then such an approach threatens to “bake in” flawed assumptions about the experience of disability into its account of just entitlements (Bodenheimer 1997a,b).

Finally, capability theories assess outcomes not only by the resources people have, nor the welfare they generate, but people’s real freedom to do and be certain things. The capability approach, developed in different ways by Martha Nussbaum (2000, 2006a, 2011) and Amartya Sen (1980, 1999, 2009), is concerned with the kinds of life individuals are able lead: with their substantive opportunities (or ‘capabilities’) to perform certain ‘functionings’, such as being healthy, sheltered, literate, well-nourished, forming intimate relationships, caring for a child, engaging in leisure activities, or having rich sensory and aesthetic experiences. The approach aims to ensure individuals have access to opportunities regardless of the resources they require to achieve this, and taking account of the wider context in which they are operating. Thus, it is well-placed to accommodate many of the core concerns of the social model, and has thus been almost universally endorsed by those considering disability in the context of distributive justice (e.g., Barclay 2010; 2018; Begon 2023a; Mitra 2017; Nussbaum 2006a; Terzi 2008; Wasserman 2006; Wolff 2009a,b; Wolff and de-Shalit 2007).

Nussbaum’s earlier formulations of the capabilities placed considerable emphasis on species-typical functioning. For example, she initially treated “the exercise of the five senses” as a necessary constituent of human flourishing. More recent formulations are more congenial to social models of disability, acknowledging the social contribution to ‘natural’ deficits (see Wasserman 1998; Terzi 2009; Begon 2017, 2023a), and recognising that most capabilities bear only a contingent, environmentally-mediated relationship to people’s ‘natural endowment’. Rather than focusing on specific functionings, such as walking we can provide a more general capability to move from place to place, which may require architectural, vehicular, mechanical, or prosthetic means, making places more accessible or making the individual more mobile. Similarly, a person lacking sight or hearing can achieve aesthetic satisfaction by other means. An individual with emphysema could increase his capacity for affiliation and control over the material environment (two capabilities from Nussbaum’s 2006a list) not only by measures to increase his lung capacity but also by measures to increase his access to social and business venues through better transit and architectural design.

Capability approaches also help to bridge the gap between theories focused on redistribution and recognition. Whilst capabilities offer a metric of distributive justice, relational theorists endorse the approach – as well as the inclusion of specific capabilities and means of promoting them – on the basis that this properly respects all members in a “society of equals” (Wolff 2009a, also Anderson 1999; 2010). Broadly, the capability approach accommodates the concerns of relational theories in two ways. First, relationships are included directly, as items on the list of central capabilities: for example, “affiliation” and “emotions” (Nussbaum 2006a), or “doing good to other’s” (Wolff and De-Shalit’s 2007). Second, indirectly, as the preconditions for having the genuine control necessary for other capabilities, since this requires both the external and internal preconditions of choice, and being in oppressive relationships or subject to unjust norms can distort the process of preference formation (Begon 2015; 2023a).

However, much will depend on which capabilities are chosen as entitlements and the means employed to secure them. On the latter point, Wolff (2009b) classifies equality-enhancing measures for people with disabilities by the extent to which they address recognition as well as redistribution. Thus, the individual limitations of people with disabilities can be addressed with either cash compensation or ‘personal enhancement’: medical, surgical, or rehabilitative measures to correct those limitations. ‘Targeted resource enhancement’ offers an intermediate option, which tries to improve the fit of the individual and the environment with a range of restricted resources such as personal assistance and assistive technology. ‘Status enhancement’ alters the built environment and social practices to reduce the impact of individual differences in abilities on social equality. Wolff generally favours status enhancement as the most respectful intervention, because it shapes the environment to the needs of all members of society, and does not require us to identify particular individuals in need of assistance. It is also the most stable intervention, because it protects social equality against sudden changes in individuals’ levels of functioning. Finally, “it helps communicate a message that human beings are all equals and should all be included in our social arrangements” (Wolff 2009b: 131).

On the former, there are various influential accounts of how we should identify the capabilities all are entitled to. For example, Elizabeth Anderson (1999; 2010) argues we should have the capabilities necessary to function as equal citizens in a democratic society; Rutger Claassen (2017; 2018) suggests we should have the capabilities necessary to express autonomous agency; and Nussbaum (2011; 2006a; 2000) focuses on the capabilities necessary to live a decent (or, perhaps, dignified) human life. Anderson’s approach is most explicitly focussed on relational concerns, but equal social standing could also be deemed essential to a decent human life, as Nussbaum’s selection of capabilities for affiliation and political control implies.

If the capability approach is understood as a metric of well-being this may seem insufficient: the moral significance of respectful treatment is neither exhausted by, nor derivative of, its contribution to individual well-being. As Schemmel argues (2012: 19), people may need some forms of affiliation to flourish but do not necessarily require social and political equality for their own well-being, nor is it only for the sake of well-being they are provided. This echoes the above objection to welfarist accounts – we cannot justify depriving disabled individuals of voting rights by providing resources to pursue leisure activities, even if this increased well-being. The capability approach can respond to this objection insofar as the selection of central capabilities is independent of their contribution to individuals’ well-being (as in Anderson’s, Claassen’s, and, arguably, Nussbaum’s accounts). However, this then leaves the approach vulnerable to the objection that people are entitled to capabilities even when they do not improve their well-being: when they “will be ignored or wasted or mishandled by the individual to whom it is provided” (Arneson 2006: 32). This is true, but whether this is objectionable remains an open question: it may cost little to provide under-utilised opportunities, and we may think this is sometimes what justice demands – votes for the politically apathetic, say (Begon 2023a).

5. Disability, Responsibility, and the Standard of Distributive Justice

Another prominent criticism of the capability approach focuses not on its distributive metric, but its distributive standard: usually, a sufficiency or threshold-approach. The criterion used to determine which capabilities are central (democratic equality, autonomy, dignity, flourishing etc.) can also be employed to determine how much of these capabilities we are entitled to: what level of opportunity is sufficient to meet the demands of justice. (Though, as Nussbaum notes, certain capabilities must be distributed equally if anyone is to have a sufficient level of them, e.g., voting rights.) In determining thresholds, accommodating severely disabled individuals seems to raise a dilemma. If the minimum for every capability must be met in the face of recalcitrant impairments or environments, it seems either impossibly demanding or to require ‘levelling-down’ for everyone. If we take the latter approach, it seems to demand too little, if attaining the minimum could still leave individuals with a miserable life (Arneson 2006; Wasserman 2006; Wolff and de-Shalit 2007). However, first, when capabilities are broadly construed (see §4) it will be possible to provide capabilities in many more cases, even when specific functionings cannot be achieved. Critics of sufficientarian approaches may object that this constitutes another form of levelling-down however: if we can have the capability for mobility despite being unable to walk, then justice does not demand the rectification of our mobility impairment (Baccarini 2026).

Even if we bite this bullet, it remains the case that setting the threshold of capabilities high enough to secure a decent life (or democratic equality, autonomy, flourishing) may seem to render the list ill-suited for individuals with some impairments, in some contexts – yet concluding that they simply fall outside the scope of justice seems unsatisfactory. This dilemma can be resolved if we drop the feasibility constraint on justice, meaning some individuals may not be able to access opportunities that justice requires they have (see §1; Gilabert and Lawford-Smith 2012; Gilabert 2017; Southwood 2018; Valentini 2009,2012). Justice may require that we work towards increasing what is feasible, but on this view of justice we need not excise items from our list of entitlements – nor excise individuals from those who can make justice claims – simply because we cannot achieve universal provision (Begon 2023a; Gheaus 2013). More work is needed to specify the content of capabilities and their relevant weightings (see Wolff and de-Shalit 2007 for progress on this), but accounting for disability does not undermine the plausibility of focusing on either capabilities or thresholds.[4]

Another central disagreement in the debate over the appropriate distributive standard is the degree to which this should be responsibility-sensitive: does the cause of our disadvantage, and our role in bringing it about, determine whether it is unjust? According to luck egalitarian approaches, inequalities are only unjust if they reflect brute luck, and not option luck – attributable to an individual’s fault, choice, or assumption of risk (Arneson 2000; Dworkin 2000, 2003; Lippert-Rasmussen 2015). Stronger versions of luck egalitarianism (e.g., Dworkin 2000) deny that any inequality resulting from option luck generates claims of justice. On those versions, disabilities only generate justice claims when they result from bad luck (e.g., congenital impairments). Other disabilities, which may involve the same or greater disadvantage, do not, simply because they resulted from a free choice (e.g., dangerous pastimes or an unhealthy lifestyle). Some philosophers have taken these implications as a reductio ad absurdum of luck egalitarianism – the ‘abandonment objection’ (Anderson 1999). However, whilst many writers on healthcare question the moral and policy relevance of individual responsibility (Cavallero 2011; Feiring 2008; Galvin 2002; Wikler 1987, 2002), others defend its place, at least when allocating scarce resources (e.g., Segall 2010; Davies and Savulescu 2019; De Marco et al. 2021; Cappelen and Norheim 2005; and see Davies et al. 2024; Brown and Savulescu 2019).

The greater concern for disability scholars may be with the conflation of disadvantages resulting from unchosen impairments with disadvantages resulting from unchosen social conditions under the one heading of ‘bad brute luck’ (Fine and Asch 1988). Luck egalitarianism does not provide any principled rationale for distinguishing between equally severe setbacks to people with disabilities that result from the ‘bad luck’ of being born in a society with disability discrimination and the ‘bad luck’ of being born with a disadvantageous set of physical abilities. Rawlsian approaches can avoid this problem insofar as justice demands the regulation of social institutions, but not health (or other) inequalities that are ‘purely natural’ (see §4). This may imply that those with congenital impairments are left unable to press justice-claims for compensation, raising a parallel form of the abandonment objection. This can, perhaps, be avoided however, if, following the social model, we accept that all (or most) of the restrictions faced by disabled people are social: the impact of the basic structure is so embedded into the experience of living with any impairments that no disadvantages are purely natural.

6. Justice and Disability Identities

There are many categories or groups into which people can place themselves, and be placed, on the basis of their varying characteristics. The salience and appeal of these categories depend on social and historical context as well as individual preferences and values. Identity and identity politics become important as members of historically excluded groups challenge their status and work for inclusion. Although people with disabilities are not always understood as sharing an identity, their awareness of membership in an oppressed group has been shaped by exclusionary laws and customs, from ‘ugly laws’ prohibiting people with physical deformities from appearing in public to the state-sponsored involuntary sterilisation of ‘mental defectives’. A sense of group identity has been further encouraged by welfare, social security and other laws that place people with various disabilities in a single category, even if they define that category in different ways (Dorfman 2017). The importance of disability as a social category was increased by the movement to establish civil rights for people with disabilities. As in the case of other stigmatised groups, the characteristics used as a ground for exclusion became a basis for mobilisation and a source of pride. The social model of disability, which informed the movement for disability rights, emphasised what people with various impairments have in common – their stigmatisation and exclusion – and thereby promoted the emergence of disability as a powerful social identity.

By identity, we mean those characteristics that make one the particular person one is, as judged both by oneself and by others, including narrative, biographical, and practical identities: the constitutive or defining features of one’s self- (or social) conception. A central issue for both relational and distributive justice theorists is the relative importance of individual and group or cultural identities. Must a just society recognise “group-specific cultural identity” or merely “the status of group members as full partners in social interaction” (Fraser 2001: 23, 24)? Are these separate requirements, or does respect for an individual entail respect for her social or cultural identities? Or, on the distributive side, must society allocate resources, broadly construed, to support the group and cultural identities of its members? That support could be based on the claim that such identities are a, perhaps irreducible, constituent of the well-being of the individual members of society, as a “context of choice” (e.g., Kymlicka 1989, Sparrow 2005). An individual deprived of a culture through which she has experienced and interpreted the world will find it far more difficult to flourish. As we will discuss, however, it is doubtful that disability in general, or particular impairments, play such a comprehensive role in the lives of many – let alone all – people with disabilities.

It is also important distinguish individual and collective identities because the latter is, to a greater extent, imposed or ‘ascribed’ by the larger society rather than chosen by the individual (Appiah 2005). Being disabled, like being a member of a minority race, subjects one to particular treatment, but one can experience that treatment without regarding one’s disability as part of one’s individual identity in the practical sense of being a description under which one values oneself (Shakespeare 2006). Often, having a disability identity ascribed to one, like having a racial identity ascribed, consists in part in being the object of, and provides excuse for, discriminatory, demeaning or degrading treatment. This is so both for people whose impairments are immediately observable and for those whose impairments are hidden but subject to exposure and ridicule by a temporary change in appearance, e.g., a person with epilepsy who has a seizure in public (Schneider and Conrad 1985; more generally, Davis 2005). Ironically, being unfairly stereotyped can itself shape the identities of those who are treated in this way, as Appiah notes, even if initially they did not identify strongly with the group in question.

Desirable change with respect to social identities is possible in at least two ways. First, even if some important aspects of one’s self are not chosen – say, the fact that one has paraplegia or deafness – how central they are to one’s self-conception, how much they matter to one’s interests and plans, is to some extent within one’s voluntary control. For Korsgaard (1996, 2009), reflective endorsement of an identity is a necessary condition of its being normative for the agent, i.e. providing reasons for her. Yet the extent to which one’s identifications are voluntary depends on the constraints of the social environment, and the degree to which one’s disability is ‘hidden’. If the identity is ascribed, and emphasised, by society, it may be difficult to reduce its importance in one’s own practical reasoning, but one still has some choice about whether to accept or resist that emphasis. Second, there can be a change in the valence of the label: what was once a negative label, accompanied by unjust treatment of various sorts, can be transformed into a positive label and championed as a source of self-respect and pride for those who share in the collective identity (Peters 2018; Garland-Thomas 2009) – for example, ‘Disability Pride’, ‘Crip Pride’, or ‘Mad Pride’ (Lewis 2017, Rashed 2023). Neither change can be accomplished without struggle, personal as well as political.

Even if disability is not, and does not have to be, a central component of every disabled person’s identity, this does not negate the significance of disability as an organising principle of political action (Reher and Evans 2025; Heffernan 2024). Nonetheless, there are risks for an identity politics of disability. First, when the social and political recognition of disability becomes the objective of political action, it gives rise to the ‘dilemma of difference’ (Minow 1990; Terzi 2005). Consider special education for children. On the one hand, labelling a child ‘disabled’ risks stigmatising and isolating the child. On the other, being labelled ‘disabled’ is a way for parents to secure attention to the child’s particular ways of learning and functioning. Thus, to be ‘different’ can both mean to be inferior and to be entitled to appropriate educational assistance. The dilemma may not be insurmountable if law and public policy can be designed such that the stigma they seek to eliminate is not, in effect, reinforced. For example, the movement for universal design in education aims to refashion classrooms and teaching practices to encourage the participation of all students, and minimise the need for ‘special education’ (Biklen 1992; Gartner and Lipsky 2002; Lipsky and Gartner 1996). Success in resolving the dilemma of difference may reduce the importance of disability identity for justice: if disability is simply a characteristic to be taken account of in social arrangements, it could become as insignificant as height or aptitude.

Second, is the danger of assuming that members of a marginalised group share the same culture and experiences (Jenks 2019; Takala 2008; Reynolds and Kiuppis 2018). This assumption is not required by a mature identity politics, but may be encouraged by efforts to mobilise diverse individuals around a single identity. To resist this tendency, we must recognise that culture is complex, and that on any plausible definition, people with the same disability (let alone different disabilities) need not share a common culture. There are examples of a shared disability culture: Deaf culture is perhaps the best known; but many people who are deaf, particularly those who do not sign, do not identify as Deaf or take part in Deaf culture (Tucker 1997; Sparrow 2005; Scully 2019; Bauman and Murray 2017). And even for those who participate, Deaf culture does not appear to be the kind of ‘comprehensive’ culture claimed by Kymlicka, Margalit, and Raz to provide a ‘context of choice’ for its members, in part because deaf people are usually geographically dispersed.

The third, related risk involves privileging one identity over others. This is especially important for people with multiple or intersectional identities (Asch 2005; Part V, Davis 2017). In one study, for example, African-American women with mobility impairments reported that they felt estranged from the disability-rights movement, because its leadership seemed predominantly white, and some of its principal goals – to maximise independence – went against their more communal values (Feldman and Tegart 2003). More generally, some have noted that mainstream feminism’s focus on independence and self-sufficiency has tended to exclude women with disabilities, who are perceived as lacking in these cardinal virtues (Crawford and Ostrove 2003; Wendell 1996). At the same time, disabled women are often particularly vulnerable to the injustices that motivate the feminist movement: they are frequently victims of sexual exploitation (Crawford and Ostrove 2003), encounter many obstacles to leaving dissatisfying relationships because of physical, psychological and financial dependency (Olkin 2003), and have median incomes below the poverty line and substantially lower than those of their male counterparts (Crawford and Ostrove 2003; Olkin 1999).

In addition to these potential risks, there have been major challenges in mobilising people with disabilities around an affirmative group or cultural identity (Watson 2002). The first, addressed by the disability rights movement, was getting people with disabilities to recognise that they have something in common with others who are differently impaired but also suffer stigma and exclusion because of their impairment. This has been difficult because people who are born with disabilities or acquire them in childhood come from widely dispersed socioeconomic, geographic and racial groups (Scotch 1988) and so are less likely to grow up with a sense of group identity. Another obstacle has been the overwhelmingly negative connotation of the label ‘disabled’ (Siebers 2017). Indeed, the challenge for people with visual, motor, and psychiatric impairments has been to recognise that they share a ‘disabled’ identity while denying that this makes them dependent, child-like, or powerless (Asch 1985; Scotch 1988); such a self-identity would quite literally disable one’s capacity for social participation and political action.

The medical model suggests a disability identity that is both fragmented and negative, which obscures the recognition of disability as a social and political problem. In contrast, the various social models were explicitly formulated to support a disability identity that could serve as the basis for claims of respect and recognition. However, the human variation model’s conceptualisation of disability as resting on an artificial dichotomy imposed on a continuum of variation can undercut the basis for a unique and exclusive identity. It may be, though, that the physical, sensory, or psychic experience of a particular impairment turns out to be central and salient to how those with the impairment live, even in a society deeply committed to inclusion, participation, and non-discrimination.

7. Disability and Epistemic Injustice

Finally, we will consider how disability identity can lead to a form of epistemic injustice, as a result of the negative prejudicial stereotypes often associated with it (Peña-Guzmán and Reynolds 2019; Cossette-Lefebvre and Zala 2026; Darling 2026). Epistemic injustice consists in a person’s being wronged in her capacity as an epistemic subject (Fricker 2007). Testimonial injustice consists in someone’s testimony being given less credence than the evidence warrants due to prejudice on the part of the hearer, while hermeneutical injustice consists in someone’s experiences being obscured from individual and collective understanding due to wrongful exclusion from the practices by which those understandings are generated.

These two forms of injustice are intimately connected (Medina 2011; 2012). For example, consider someone being “labelled mentally ill or dishonest” when their “bodily experience is radically different from medical descriptions of her/his condition” (Wendell 1989: 120). On the one hand, it seems the speaker’s testimony may be dismissed as non-credible because its content is unintelligible. The dominance of medicalised models render unintelligible the experiences of rejecting a ‘cure’ or being proud of a disability: the understanding of disability as implying defect or absence leaves no space to render comprehensible testimony that interprets disability as a source of new experiences and abilities, or of identity and a sense of self. It is important to highlight, then, that hermeneutic lacuna need not be universally shared (see Dotson 2012; Medina 2012; Polhaus 2012). As this entry has made clear, there are well-developed theories and concepts that can render these experiences intelligible. Thus, the problem in the context of disability is not that hermeneutic resources are lacking (as in the cases Fricker focuses on), but that they fail to gain appropriate uptake. Part of the explanation for this is that disabled individuals and scholars who might offer alternative narratives are not considered credible. This is often due to a prejudicial assumption that disabled individuals are unreliable interlocuters – perhaps because they are deemed irrational, ‘child-like’, or simply unaware of better options (Begon 2016, 2020; Carel and Kidd 2014, 2017a,b; Dohmen 2016; Marsh 2020; Scully 2018; Stramondo 2021) – compounded by the apparent incomprehensibility of the content of their testimony. This perpetuates a vicious circle: the understanding of disability as a tragic lack of essential opportunities leads to a failure to understand or believe alternative narratives, compounding the unjustified credibility deficits disabled individuals are already subject to, and increasing the likelihood that current conceptions remain dominant.

This most obviously influences how able-bodied individuals understand disability, and this can cause significant harm to disabled individuals, in additional to the epistemic harms of not being believed or being unable to make one’s experiences understood. For example, consider the use of quality-adjusted life years (QALYs) to assess the prospective benefits of healthcare interventions, wherein disabled life-years are discounted at a rate determined by asking people how many years of life with the disability people would be willing to exchange for each year of life without the disability. The result is that people with disabilities have their healthcare needs discounted for the very reason they are disabled. This case may also indicate testimonial injustice insofar as it unjustly deflates the first-person authority of people with disabilities. This is also plausibly an example of hermeneutical injustice, insofar as it wrongly exaggerates the difference in quality between able-bodied and disabled lives, perpetuating the stereotype of disability as tragic, occlusive of life’s major goods, and so on, and this poor understanding of disabled people’s experiences and identities results from their exclusion from the public sphere.

Finally, these skewed understanding can also undermine disabled individuals’ ability to conceptualise their own experiences (Peters 2018; Chapman and Carel 2022). Not every disabled person is a member of a disabled community or has access to alternative understandings of their circumstances. Indeed, the process of finding this community is, itself, inhibited by dominant understandings of disability as an “individual tragedy or private burden”, not “something that gives you access to – or something you experience with – a community” (Barnes 2015: 184). Thus, media representations constitute the primary source of epistemic resources regarding disabled life for many, rendering its paucity of representational variety and realism particularly problematic (Begon 2023b; Schatz and George 2018). This provides only a sketch; much work remains to be done exploring the implications of epistemic injustice for people with disabilities.

8. Conclusion

This entry has provided only a brief overview of the many ways in which understanding disability and reflecting on disabled individuals’ experiences impacts our accounts of what justice demands. Disability has traditionally been treated as an afterthought in theories of justice – a convenient example of disadvantage in the context of distributive justice, or a test case for the limits of contractarianism, say. However, over the past few decades it has begun to play a more central role, with accounts more informed by models and theories developed by disabled scholars and activists. The result is not only to clarify and improve our theories of what just treatment of disabled individuals entails, but to improve and clarify theories of justice in many domains.

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Acknowledgments

As of the 2026 revision, Jessica Begon has taken over responsibility for updating and maintaining this entry.

Copyright © 2026 by
Jessica Begon <jessica.e.begon@durham.ac.uk>
Daniel Putnam
David Wasserman
Jeffrey Blustein
Adrienne Asch

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