A. Forgiveness in the History of Western Philosophy

Forgiveness was not upheld as a virtue in the Ancient Greek world (Griswold 2007b: 278), nor was it subject to close philosophical investigation. In Ancient writings we do find discussions of the importance of moderating anger, which many contemporary philosophers take to be connected to forgiveness. For example, in Book IV of the Republic, Plato claims that demonstrations of anger are generally regarded as manifestations of intemperance, which is a vice. Since angry emotions threaten to overwhelm reason and self-control they must be rationally controlled in the name of a harmonious ordering of the different parts of the soul (Republic, 439–442). Aristotle’s general perspective on morally appropriate anger is that the person of virtue is “angry at the right things and with the right people, and, further, as he ought, when he ought, and as long as he ought” (1125b32). Aristotle calls this the virtue of mildness, even though this virtue will sometimes require the victim of wrongdoing to display sustained high levels of anger. Some contemporary scholars try to transform these materials into an Aristotelian account of forgiveness (Roberts 1995: 298; Carter 2018: 49), but others claim that Plato and Aristotle simply do not focus on or encourage forgiveness (Griswold 2007b: 279; Konstan 2010: 11; Chappell 2023: 80). Similarly, the Stoics did write about clemency and beneficence, both of which bear on forgiveness, but neither of which are equivalent to forgiveness (Pettigrove 2012: 125-6).

Bishop Joseph Butler is the historical figure who is commonly cited as the progenitor of contemporary emotion-focused accounts of forgiveness. His legacy in the philosophical literature on forgiveness rests on two of his Fifteen Sermons (1726): Sermon VIII (“Upon Resentment”) and Sermon IX (“Upon Forgiveness of Injuries”). His recent interpreters have often attributed to him the view that forgiveness is the forswearing or overcoming of resentment (Murphy 1988: 15; Haber 1991: 16; Holmgren 1993: 341). Garcia (2011) has called this interpretation of Butler the “Renunciation Model”, according to which Butler holds: (1) that resentment is a “negative vindictive response that is incompatible with goodwill”; and (2) that forgiveness occurs “only insofar as we forswear or renounce our negative feelings of resentment towards our wrongdoers” (2011: 2). Garcia and others have convincingly argued, however, that Butler did not advocate the Renunciation Model, for he advocated neither of these two theses (Garcia 2011; Griswold 2007: 19–37).

What Butler actually says is that forgiveness is perfectly compatible with an attitude of resentment. Butler held that resentment helps us to deal with those who harm us: it motivates us to insulate ourselves from wrongdoers, and it motivates us to deter future wrongdoing via punishment. When resentment has these ends it serves the public good and is therefore compatible with the general obligation to good-will [IX.9]. Butler does claim that when resentment is allowed to become “excessive” it can easily lead an agent to pursue revenge, not as a means to producing some greater social good, but as a self-gratifying exercise that seeks “the misery of our fellow creatures” [IX.10]. But to let resentment carry one this far is to violate a general obligation to benevolence. To forgive, then, is simply to prevent resentment from having this effect on us. The divine command to benevolence is therefore just the command to “prevent [resentment] from having this effect, i.e. to forgive injuries, is the same as to love our enemies” [IX.13.]. Resentment itself is natural and innocent. It is only when it is indulged and allowed to bleed into revenge that a violation of goodwill occurs. But this is the work of forgiveness: to prevent resentment from leading us to seek revenge. Therefore, Butler does not think that forgiveness is the forswearing or overcoming of resentment.

What, then, is forgiveness according to Butler? Griswold claims that Butler’s forgiveness involves two aspects: (1) the forswearing of revenge; and (2) a moderation of resentment to an appropriate level (2007: 36). According to Ernesto Garcia, “Butlerian forgiveness simply amounts to being virtuously resentful by avoiding both excessive and deficient resentment against our wrongdoers” (2011: 17). On either of these interpretations, Butler’s account does not correspond closely with any of the more popular contemporary accounts of forgiveness. However, McNaughton claims that Butler’s conception of forgiveness is more demanding than it may seem, as Butler believes that the victim who has forgiven does not bear any ill-will towards the wrongdoer (2023: 124).

Kant briefly addresses the topic of forgiveness in The Metaphysics of Morals. Here he claims that all wrongdoing deserves punishment, but that only God has the authority to inflict this punishment. Kant says that it is a “duty of human beings to be forgiving” and suggests that this means that we must not take revenge or act out of hatred, but neither should we meekly tolerate wrongdoing or let others trample on our rights (Kant 1797, 6:460-1, [1996, 578]). Contemporary Kantian scholars have tried to reconstruct a Kantian account of forgiveness from these materials, but these accounts differ greatly from one another. Sussman claims that Kant believed we have an unconditional duty to forgive those who wrong us and that forgiveness is incompatible with continued punishment (Sussman 2005: 104). Satne says that Kantian forgiveness is merely incompatible with hate and vindictiveness, and that we ought to forgive only when conditions have been met by the wrongdoer (Satne 2016: 1031).