Forgiveness

To forgive is to respond in a particular way to someone who has treated someone badly or wrongly. In paradigmatic cases, forgiveness is a triadic relation between a wrong action φ, a wrongdoer and a wronged victim; the victim forgives the wrongdoer for having done φ. By forgiving, a victim can move on from φ while still judging that it was a culpable wrong. It has been claimed that the core of forgiveness is the giving up of certain negative emotions towards the wrongdoer, or the forbearance of negative treatment of the wrongdoer, or the restoration of the relationship with the wrongdoer, or the alteration of the norms bearing on victim and wrongdoer. Much philosophical discussion of forgiveness centers on three primary questions: (1) What is the nature of forgiveness—what must one do in order to forgive; (2) What is the scope of forgiveness—when is one in a position to forgive and which things can be forgiven; and (3) What are the norms governing forgiveness—when is forgiveness morally good, right, or praiseworthy?

• 1. Forgiveness as a Response to Wrongdoing
• 2. Related Phenomena
  • 2.1 Justification
  • 2.2 Excuse
  • 2.3 Forgetting
  • 2.4 Pardon and Mercy
  • 2.5 Reconciliation
  • 2.6 Condonation
• 3. Standing and Target
• 4. Theories of Forgiveness
  • 4.1 What kind of positive change?
  • 4.2 Forgiveness and Emotion
  • 4.3 Forgiveness, Judgments, and Attitudes
  • 4.4 Forgiveness and Behaviour
  • 4.5 Performative Accounts
  • 4.6 Pluralist Accounts
• 5. Non-Standard Kinds of Forgiveness
  • 5.1 Self-Forgiveness
  • 5.2 Divine Forgiveness
  • 5.3 Group Forgiveness and Political Forgiveness
• 6. The Ethics of Forgiveness
  • 6.1 Moral Disagreements about Forgiveness
  • 6.2 Criticism of Forgiveness
  • 6.3 Strong Endorsement of Forgiveness
  • 6.4 Cautious Endorsement of Forgiveness
  • 6.5 Forgiveness and Virtue
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

• Appendix A. Forgiveness in the History of Western Philosophy
• Appendix B. The Science of Forgiveness

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1. Forgiveness as a Response to Wrongdoing

An inevitable and unfortunate fact of life is that we are often mistreated by others. In response to having been wronged, we might resent, blame, seek revenge, impose punishment, and demand apology and compensation. Forgiving stands in contrast as a less hostile, less combative response to having been wronged. There are influential religious and secular traditions, including Christianity and therapeutic psychology, that strongly encourage victims to forgive. Moreover, many wrongdoers hope to be forgiven for what they have done. Forgiveness is frequently presented as allowing both victim and perpetrator to recover from wrongdoing, perhaps reconciling, or at least moving on in peace. Arguably, forgiveness is sometimes required in order to restore or preserve valuable relationships and to end cycles of revenge.

Although interpersonal forgiveness is prominent in contemporary moral discourse, it was neither examined nor encouraged by the Ancient Greeks (Konstan 2010: 11; Griswold 2007b: 278), and was largely ignored in the history of Western philosophy. The most significant exception is Bishop Butler, who claims that forgiveness is incompatible with revenge, but is compatible with sustained proportionate anger (Butler 1726; Griswold 2007a: 19; Garcia 2011: 5). (See Appendix 1: Forgiveness in the History of Western Philosophy.)

Even amongst contemporary advocates, there is great disagreement over what forgiveness is supposed to be. According to the Oxford English Dictionary, to ‘forgive’ is to cease to harbour resentment, to remit a debt, to pardon an offence, to make excuse or apology for, or to regard indulgently. This dictionary definition is strikingly broad. The remittance or cancellation of financial debts is a separate phenomenon that falls outside of the kind of forgiveness that philosophers and psychologists are interested in; namely, forgiveness of wrongdoing. Some psychologists think that, so long as we exclude the cancellation of debts, the broad dictionary definition is correct. They suggest that a victim forgives simply by getting over the wrong and moving on (McCullough et al. 2000: 9; Billingsley et al. 2020: 54). In contrast, philosophers have offered a range of more precise and restrictive definitions of forgiveness, treating it as one special way of moving past wrongdoing. Philosophers take great pains to distinguish forgiving from a range of related phenomena, including excusing and pardoning. Many philosophers think that forgiveness is morally complex and puzzling, and some question whether it is paradoxical (Kolnai 1973/4: 99).

2. Related Phenomena

2.1 Justification

If a stranger in a crowded marketplace deliberately treads on your foot, you might respond with anger and blame. But if you then realise that this stranger trod on your foot to catch your attention and quietly alert you to the presence of a pickpocket, your reaction will change. You now see that his action was justified, and that he did not wrong you. Coming to see that an action is justified is one way of overcoming resentment and blame, but it is not compatible with forgiving the agent for that action. If the action was justified, then there is nothing to forgive (Kolnai 1973/4: 95; Allais 2008: 34). When we forgive someone for what they have done, we still judge that what they did was wrong, or at least constitutes some kind of failure. This is why it can be offensive when someone says that she forgives you for having done something when what you did was not actually wrong.

2.2 Excuse

Sometimes we react negatively to people who are doing things that are indeed morally bad or impermissible, but we later come to see that what they did was not actually their fault. In such cases, so-called excusing conditions render the agent not blameworthy. We typically excuse agents for what they have done when they had no choice, when they acted under coercion, when they were significantly cognitively impaired, or when they were non-culpably ignorant of what they were doing (Strawson 1962: 192). Coming to see that an agent ought to be excused is another way of overcoming resentment and moving past blame.

Most philosophers claim that excusing is not merely distinct from forgiving, but is incompatible with forgiving. The forgiver moves on while still judging that the wrongdoer is culpable and has no good excuse (Strawson 1962: 191; Haber 1991: 33; Bash 2007: 5; Allais 2008: 36; Hieronymi 2001: 530; for the contrary view see Neblett 1974: 272; Boleyn-Fitzgerald 2002: 486). Forgiving, unlike excusing, is an option for victims when they know that the wrongdoer was to blame; the wrong action was his fault. It might be suggested that a victim’s discovery of mitigating circumstances can lead her to partially excuse while also partially forgiving the wrongdoer, but in this case there remains an incompatibility between wholly forgiving and wholly excusing (Russell 2023a: 37).

2.3 Forgetting

Another way in which victims can move past the fact that they have been wronged is by forgetting that it happened. It is widely held that forgiving is distinct from forgetting, and that mere forgetting is not sufficient for forgiving. Some even say forgiving is incompatible with forgetting (Kolnai 1973/4: 100). Yet it is sometimes recommended that a victim of wrongdoing forgive and forget, which suggests that forgiving must be compatible with forgetting in some way (Lang 1994: 108). Blustein claims that forgiving requires a kind of forgetting, or a restricted kind of remembering (2014: 101). Russell proposes instead that ‘forgive and forget’ should be read as meaning forgive and then eventually forget (2023a: 43). At the time of forgiving, the forgiver must still remember that she was culpably wronged by the perpetrator. If this is correct, then forgetting is not a way of forgiving, but forgiving is compatible with subsequent forgetting.

2.4 Pardon and Mercy

The OED definition includes pardoning as a kind of forgiveness. In contrast, philosophers take forgiveness to be distinct from pardon and from the related concept of mercy. The word ‘pardon’ can refer to a familiar and important legal and political power quite unlike forgiveness. Black’s Law Dictionary defines this sense of pardon as “an act or an instance of officially nullifying punishment or other legal consequences of a crime”, ordinarily “granted by the chief executive of a government” (Garner 1999: 1137). In the United States, for example, the President has the authority to grant pardons for federal offenses, and state governors may pardon crimes against the state. Unlike forgiveness, institutional pardon and mercy can be exercised only by people who occupy the requisite institutional roles. Many victims have no control over whether the authorities will punish the wrongdoer, whereas the victim can decide whether to offer forgiveness. This leads some philosophers to claim that forgiveness and mercy work in different domains (Kolnai 1973/4: 93; Allais 2013: 650).

However, the words ‘pardon’ and ‘mercy’ are sometimes used to refer to the waiving of further informal retribution by the victim of wrongdoing herself, independent of any institution. This kind of interpersonal pardoning is compatible with forgiving, but there is deep disagreement as to whether it is an essential feature of forgiveness, or whether the victim can forgive while continuing to punish and refusing to show mercy (see section 4.4 Forgiveness and Behaviour). Several facts suggest that forgiving is distinct from interpersonal pardoning and being merciful (Murphy & Hampton 1988; 158; Tosi & Warmke 2017: 212). Pardon and mercy are essentially overt, whereas forgiveness is sometimes private. It is possible to show mercy to a wrongdoer only when the punishment has not already been administered in full, but a victim can choose to forgive or to refuse forgiveness even after the wrongdoer has finished receiving full punishment (Allais 2008: 48). Arguably, it is possible to forgive someone after they are dead, but it not clear that we could be merciful to the dead.

2.5 Reconciliation

Wrongdoing typically damages the relationship between the victim and the wrongdoer, sometimes leading the victim to terminate that relationship, to refuse to cooperate, or to simply avoid the wrongdoer. Subsequent apology or even just the passage of time can lead the victim to reconcile with the wrongdoer, restoring the relationship to a state of harmony.

This kind of reconciliation often accompanies or follows from forgiveness. Nonetheless, reconciliation can occur without forgiveness. Reconciliation can be the result of excusing or justifying rather than forgiving. More contentiously, we might claim that a fearful victim can choose to reconcile with the wrongdoer while still resenting and feeling contempt for him, hence failing to forgive him (Russell 2023a: 168).

Some philosophers believe that reconciliation is an essential part of forgiveness (Wilson 1988: 534; Calhoun 1992: 84). This restriction would severely limit the availability of forgiveness, rendering forgiving impossible when a hostile wrongdoer refuses to reconcile with a willing victim, or when the wrongdoer is dead or otherwise beyond communicative reach. The more common view is that it is possible to forgive without reconciling, and even while refusing to reconcile (Holmgren 1993: 342; Pettigrove 2012: 15). This makes forgiveness more widely available and allows advocates of forgiveness to claim that a victim can forgive a dangerous repeat offender without having to re-enter the relationship and put herself at risk (Garrard & McNaughton 2011: 106).

2.6 Condonation

Forgiving is distinct from condoning, and many philosophers say that it is incompatible with condoning. We might reach this conclusion by assuming that forgiving is essentially a morally good or virtuous response to wrongdoing, whereas condoning, by definition, is a morally bad response (Kolnai 1973/4: 97–8; cf. Hieronymi 2001: 531). Alternatively, we might think that forgiving is incompatible with condoning on the grounds that a person who condones φ makes a judgment that is not made by forgivers. Perhaps someone who condones φ must mistakenly believe that φ was not morally wrong, whereas the forgiver still judges that φ was wrong. Thus, it would be impossible to forgive and condone one and the same action at the same time (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 40; Holmgren 1993: 47; Govier 1999: 60; Garrard & McNaughton 2010: 85; Cornell 2017: 247).

Yet this argument rests on a contentiously narrow conception of condonation (Griswold 2007a: 46). The language of condonation is also used to criticise authority figures who correctly judge that φ was wrong, but who decide to tolerate φ, or to impose only a disproportionately mild punishment. To condone a wrong action, in this sense, is to fail to resist it strongly enough (Russell 2023a: 65). If this is what it means to condone φ, then there is no straightforward incompatibility between forgiving and condoning. Perhaps some victims condone the wrong (i.e. fail to resist it strongly enough) by forgiving too readily (Lang 1994: 111; Novitz 1998: 305; Bennett 2018: 220). On this account, forgiving would be distinct from condoning, but it would be possible for a victim to forgive and condone one and the same offence.

3. Standing and Target

When a victim is wronged, unrelated third parties are able to rebuke, blame, and punish the wrongdoer. In contrast, it is often assumed that not just anyone can forgive the wrongdoer for having committed that wrong. If your friend suddenly declared that she has forgiven the Spanish Inquisitors for torturing heretics, you might wonder whether she understands how forgiveness works. Who is she, you might ask, to forgive these wrongs? In this case, your friend simply does not have the standing to forgive (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 21).

One thing that is sometimes meant by ‘standing’ is entitlement or right. In this sense, a hypocrite does not have the standing to blame someone for doing what the hypocrite routinely does himself. If the hypocrite does go ahead and blame the wrongdoer, he does so inappropriately. However, this is not the meaning of ‘standing’ as it is usually used in relation to forgiveness. When philosophers ask who has the standing to forgive they are asking who is in a position to forgive, who is capable of forgiving, or who might forgive, whether they do so rightly or wrongly. (Pettigrove 2009: 583; Hughes 2016: 365; Russell 2020: 2; for the contrary view see Fritz & Miller 2022.) There are several competing views about who has the standing (i.e. the ability) to forgive.

Victim-Only Forgiveness: It is often claimed that only the victim has the standing to forgive the wrongdoer (Downie 1965: 128; Murphy & Hampton 1988: 21; Roberts 1995: 291, Owens 2012: 51; Zaragoza 2012: 612). For example, if you physically assault me, then only I have the standing to forgive you for that assault, because I am the one whom you wrongfully assaulted. The idea that only the victim has the capacity to forgive mirrors the claim that only the person to whom the money is owed has the power to cancel that debt (Pettigrove 2009: 583). Often a wrong action harms a number of indirect or secondary victims in addition to the direct victim. Perhaps we should allow that indirect victims of the wrong action φ also have the standing to forgive the wrongdoer for doing φ, on the assumption that this is not a substitute for being forgiven by the direct victim (Griswold 2007a: 118).

Forgiveness by Proxy: Beyond this, we might wonder whether someone who is not the direct victim could forgive on behalf of that victim. For example, there are cases in which surviving family members say that they forgive a murderer on behalf of the deceased victim (Griswold 2007a: 119). Yet it is not clear that any purported proxy actually has the standing to forgive on behalf of the victim. One concern is whether a proxy can know what the victim herself would have wished in these circumstances. Another problem arises when several people claim to speak for the victim, and they disagree as to whether the victim would have forgiven.

Suitably Related Third-Party Forgiveness: In opposition to the restrictive ‘victim-only’ view on standing, some philosophers have claimed that some third parties who are not even indirect victims of φ nonetheless have the standing to forgive the wrongdoer for having done φ (Govier 1999: 68; Garrard 2002: 149; Allais 2008: 37; Pettigrove 2009: 594; Walker 2013: 49–6). This seems more plausible when the third parties in question have an association with the victim, or with the perpetrator, or have some special commitment to combatting the kind of wrong that was committed. These are grounds for saying that this instance of wrongdoing matters to them personally, even though they were not wronged by it.

In addition to these disagreements as to who can forgive, there are further disputes as to what can be forgiven. We might think that the victim forgives φ, the wrong action. Alternatively, it could be that the victim forgives the wrongdoer. Both of these options seem incomplete. For example, if you claimed that you have forgiven the malicious gossip about you, we would assume that you have forgiven the gossipers for saying what they said about you. If you claimed that you have forgiven your sister, we would assume that you have forgiven her for having done something. Thus, it seems that the target of forgiveness is more complex: the victim forgives the wrongdoer for having done φ (Griswold 2007a: 5–6).

Beyond this, there are several disputes over the target of forgiveness. Although Cornell has argued that pre-emptive forgiveness is possible (2017: 241), the dominant view is that we can forgive people only for past and present wrongdoing, not for future wrongs (Griswold 2007a: 71). Another question concerns whether forgiveness is always targeted at morally wrong actions, or whether we can also forgive people for their non-voluntary but deplorable emotional responses, for their vicious character traits, or for who they are (Dillon 2001: 59; Bell 2008: 638; Pettigrove 2012: 41). These could be grouped with morally wrong actions into the broader category of culpable moral failings (Russell 2023a: 60). While it is broadly accepted that the paradigmatic cases of forgiveness are targeted at moral failings, it has been suggested that we also can forgive people for letting us down or harming us in ways that were not morally wrong (Haji 1998; Dillon 2001: 60).

Another disagreement concerns whether forgiveness can be mistargeted. Many philosophers claim that forgiveness only ever occurs in response to actual moral failures, and never in response to things that are mistakenly perceived to be moral failures (Downie 1965: 128; Londey 1986: 4; Bell 2008: 631; Allais 2013: 643). As Konstan puts it, “one cannot forgive an innocent person” (2010: 2). We can call this the view that forgiveness is morally factive. Arguably, most other common responses to actions in this domain are not morally factive. Resentment, blame, punishment, and apology are sometimes directed at actions that are mistakenly perceived to be wrong, but that are objectively permissible or even virtuous. For example, protesters may complain that political prisoners are being punished for heroically resisting a corrupt government. Some philosophers have argued that forgiveness is similarly not morally factive, in the sense that it is possible (but not appropriate) for someone to forgive an agent for having done φ when φ is not actually wrong (Pettigrove 2012: 5; Russell 2016: 708; Scarre 2016: 941). Allowing for the possibility of mistargeted forgiveness is unattractive to those who assume that every act of forgiveness is morally good, and to those who assume that forgiveness changes the norms that bind the wrongdoer (e.g. Fritz & Miller 2022: 776).

4. Theories of Forgiveness

4.1 What kind of positive change?

Most philosophers claim that the forgiver still judges that she was wronged and still judges that the wrongdoer had no good excuse, but has now moved on, gotten over it, or let it go. The forgiver no longer holds the wrong against the wrongdoer. Let us hold this assumption fixed throughout the remaining sections. In giving a more complete account of forgiveness we must specify the relevant sense in which, after forgiveness, the forgiver does not hold the wrong against the perpetrator. There is enormous disagreement on this matter. Some common but contested claims include the following:

1. Emotion: forgiving necessarily includes moving past particular kinds of negative emotion. Forgiveness requires feeling more positively about the wrongdoer.
2. Judgments / Attitudes: Forgiving necessarily includes forming comparatively positive judgements about and attitudes towards the wrongdoer. Forgiveness requires thinking more positively about the wrongdoer.
3. Behaviour: Forgiving necessarily includes moving past particular kinds of negative treatment of the wrongdoer. Forgiveness requires acting more positively towards the wrongdoer.
4. Normative Power: Forgiving is a commitment and/or an action that functions to change the obligations that bind the victim and the wrongdoer.

Some philosophers believe that a single one of these claims captures the sense in which the forgiver has moved on and no longer holds the wrong against the perpetrator. Others endorse various combinations of these claims.

4.2 Forgiveness and Emotion

One common view is that forgiveness necessarily includes the loss, reduction, or absence of certain negative emotions, with resentment being the central candidate (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 21; Richards 1988: 79; Moore 1989: 184; Hughes 1993: 108; Darwall 2006: 72). We can call this the view that forgiveness counteracts these negative emotions. This view fits with the common claim that forgiveness involves a change of heart (Kolnai 1973/4: 97), and that a victim who forgives thereby attains a kind of inner peace.

It would be possible to claim that this change in feelings is the only positive movement that is required for forgiveness. Typically, though, philosophers say that this change in feelings is necessary but not sufficient, and that forgiveness also requires certain changes in judgements (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 83–85), or changes in judgments and behaviour (Hieronymi 2001: 551; Griswold 2007a: 53). (For the contrary view that forgiveness is compatible with sustained high levels of resentment and hostile feelings see Zaibert 2009: 388; Cornell 2017: 264.) Amongst philosophers who think that forgiveness counteracts negative emotions there is significant disagreement on two main points: which specific emotions are counteracted by forgiveness, and which kind of counteracting is necessary for forgiveness. We will consider these two issues in turn.

Which emotions are counteracted by forgiveness? There are numerous negative emotions that one might experience after being wronged, including hatred, anger, sadness, disappointment, and hurt. One possible view is that forgiveness requires only that we overcome a small subset of them—those emotions that might be best described as vindictive, vengeful, malicious, spiteful, or hateful (e.g. Murphy & Hampton 1988: 82). This hatred-focused account may appeal to philosophers who believe that all wrongdoing ought to be forgiven. However, if the hatred-focused account were true, then forgiving would be compatible with continuing to feel unabated high levels of non-hateful anger towards the wrongdoer, a result that strikes most philosophers as being implausible.

Many contemporary philosophers believe that the key emotion counteracted by forgiveness is resentment (Strawson 1962: 191; Hieronymi 2001: 530; Bash 2007: 161). There is some disagreement amongst philosophers of forgiveness as to whether resentment is essentially a vindictive emotion that includes a desire for pay-back (Garrard and McNaughton 2002; Murphy 2003: 16) or whether resentment does not necessarily include a desire for retaliation (Holmgren 2012: 31). Let us proceed on the assumption that the relevant conception of resentment is the Strawsonian reactive attitude, according to which resentment is a moralised anger that is directed by the victim towards a wrongdoer in light of a perceived failure by the wrongdoer to show sufficient goodwill towards the victim (Strawson 1962: 191; Hughes 1993: 331; MacLachlan 2010: 425). Resentment, so conceived, is a hostile emotion, but it need not include feelings of malice, hatred, or vengefulness. Strawsonian resentment need not be brooding, defensive, or secretive. Resentment is an emotion that it is possible to conceal from others, but resentment typically primes victims to engage in a range of confrontational behaviours including blaming, rebuking, and asking for an apology (Warmke and McKenna 2013: 191). Depending on the circumstances, the feeling of resentment might also motivate the victim to punish, to ostracise, or to avoid the wrongdoer (Griswold 2007a: 26; Russell 2019: 282). Strawson claims that only the victim of wrongdoing is in a position to feel resentment, and that the moralised anger that is felt by third parties who witness wrongdoing should instead be classified as indignation (1962: 199).

Strawson and Hieronymi offer a resentment-focused accounts of forgiveness, according to which the only emotion counteracted by forgiveness is resentment (Strawson 1962, 191; Hieronymi 2001: 54–6). A slightly broader alternative to this is a moralised anger-focused account, according to which forgiveness counteracts resentment, indignation, and other varieties of blame-feeling (Allais 2023: 216; cf. Hughes 1993: 334). Several philosophers say that forgiveness also counteracts some hostile reactive attitudes that are not varieties of anger. According to a hostile reactive attitudes-focused account, a victim who forgives thereby overcomes her resentment and indignation and also no longer feels contempt or scorn for the wrongdoer (Griswold 2007a: 41; Bell 2008: 628; Pettigrove 2012: 6; McNaughton & Garrard 2017: 112).

Finally, we could adopt a significantly broader negative emotion-focused accounts of forgiveness. According to this view, forgiveness counteracts all negative emotions that a victim may have felt towards the perpetrator on account of the wrongdoing in question. Richards claims that not only must one overcome emotions like malice, moral anger, and contempt in order to forgive, one must also overcome sadness and disappointment, neither of which are hostile emotions (1988: 77–79; also see Holmgren 1993: 341; Murphy 2003: 59). To some critics, this seems too expansive. Forgiveness may well include reaching a kind of inner peace and losing hostility towards the wrongdoer, but lingering feelings of sadness and disappointment are compatible with having forgiven and moved on (Hughes 1993: 334; Pettigrove 2012: 7; Lippitt 2020: 148).

The second main point of disagreement amongst advocates of emotion-focused accounts concerns the way in which forgiveness counteracts the negative emotions in question. Writers on forgiveness have claimed that the forgiver forswears these negative emotions (Strawson 1962: 191), or overcomes them (Murphy 2003: 16; Holmgren 1993: 341), or abandons them (Richards 1988: 184), or lets them go (Griswold 2007a: 40), or eliminates them (Lauritzen 1987: 142). Most of these formulations suggest that in order for forgiveness to be possible, the victim must first feel the negative emotions. In contrast, some have claimed that a victim can forgive immediately, without first having felt resentment, indignation, or contempt, as is common when a parent forgives their own child (Downie 1965: 133; Roberts 1995: 290; Pettigrove 2012: 3). If instant forgiveness is possible, then forgiveness might nonetheless entail the subsequent absence or moderation of the relevant negative emotions, in which case it would still make sense to say that forgiveness counteracts resentment (Russell 2023a: 51).

After the victim has forgiven the wrongdoer for φ, is it possible for her to feel any further resentment over φ? One option would be to claim that forgiveness entails the complete elimination or subsequent absence of the relevant negative emotions, such that a single twinge of resentment felt years later would imply that the victim had never really forgiven. If this were true, forgiveness would turn out to be rarer than many of us suppose and it would be difficult even for a victim herself to know whether she has forgiven. It is more common to claim that forgiveness results in either the subsequent absence of resentment or its reduction to insignificant levels (Holmgren 1993: 341–2; Pettigrove 2012: 18). However, if the victim sincerely says ‘I forgive you’ but her negative emotions quickly resurface and persist at high levels, then the victim did not actually forgive the wrongdoer in the first place (Lang 1994: 338; Govier & Verwoerd 2002: 97; Scarre 2016: 932). Some philosophers believe that it is possible for a victim to retract forgiveness or ‘unforgive’ in certain circumstances (Scarre 2016: 941; Wonderley 2022: 478), in which case strong resentment could resurface without negating the fact that the victim was previously in the state of having forgiven the wrongdoer.

Most philosophers say that only a special kind of reduction or elimination of negative emotions will count as forgiveness. Were you accidentally to fall and hit your head on a rock, thereby causing your resentment to be eliminated, you would not have forgiven. Or if your resentment simply withered away over the years via a process outside of your control or ken, it is widely thought that you would not have forgiven (cf. Horsbrugh 1974: 271). This is tied to the common claim that forgiving is an action, that it is something that the forgiver does rather than something that merely happens to her. Some philosophers take this to mean that forgiving is under the voluntary control of the forgiver (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 23; Hughes 1993: 333). Adams adds the claim that forgiving necessarily includes “agent effort” (1991: 284). Perhaps instead the relevant point is that forgiving is an action that is done for a reason, regardless of whether it is effortful or under voluntary control (Hieronymi 2001: 530; cf. Murphy 2001: 561). Some add that forgiving is the removal of resentment via a commitment that is made by the forgiver, who not merely overcomes but forswears these hostile reactive attitudes (Adams 1991: 284).

If forgiving centrally involves reducing your hostile emotions and forgiving is a reason-governed action, we might conclude that forgiving is a “willed change of heart” (North 1987: 506), or that forgiving is the removal of hostile reactive attitudes for the right kind of reason and in the right kind of way (Griswold 2007b: 276; Roberts 1995: 299). In this vein, Hieronymi claims that ‘ridding oneself of resentment by taking a specially designed pill … would not count as forgiveness” (Hieronymi 2001: 530). There is deep dispute as to which reasons for eliminating resentment count as the kind that are essential for forgiveness. According to Hieronymi, the forgiving victim’s resentment is revised away in light of information that reveals that the wrong action no longer conveys a threatening message (Hieronymi 2001: 548). Others claim that the forgiving victim’s resentment is removed for morally good reasons, which might include the fact that the wrongdoer has repented and apologised (Griswold 2007a: 50), or that he has suffered enough (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 24). Hampton adds that forgiving is sometimes done for the sake of others, as when parents forgive each other for the sake of their children (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 39). Many philosophers agree that, even if there is a broader class of reasons for which people might choose to forgive, forgiving is never done for selfish or ‘therapeutic’ reasons (Hughes 1993: 338; Richards 1988: 79; Bell 2008: 636; Milam 2018: 571). This has led some philosophers to propose that we distinguish forgiveness from ‘letting go of blame’, which is supposed to refer to what happens when victims remove their blame and resentment for prudential reasons (Brunning & Milam 2023: 725).

These restrictive philosophical theories have been criticised on the grounds that they exclude many common instances of forgiveness. Therapists frequently recommend that victims forgive those who wronged them for the sake of the victims’ own happiness. According to this view, ‘letting it go’ is not an alternative to forgiving, but is just another way of forgiving. Regardless of whether you think that such acts of forgiveness are morally admirable, it is highly revisionary to claim that victims never forgive for prudential reasons (Ingram 2013: 1070; Russell 2023a: 48). Arguably, some victims forgive by removing their resentment in order to attain inner peace, or in order to escape the burden of conflict (Pettigrove 2006: 488–9; Radzik 2009: 117; Garrard & McNaughton 2011: 105; Nelkin 2013: 169; Russell 2019: 283). Maybe some victims forgive by manipulating themselves out of feeling angry, rather than by rationally revising away their resentment (Novitz 1998: 308; O’Hagan 2019: 539). Even further, perhaps some victims forgive passively and for no reason (Nelkin 2013: 169; Arneson 2021: 287); When reflecting on the wrong, years after the fact, they might simply discover that their resentment is gone and they have forgiven. Russell has argued that a forgiver can moderate her initial resentment via any process, and that there is nothing incoherent in the idea of a forgiveness pill (2023a: 166).

4.3 Forgiveness, Judgments, and Attitudes

Our task is to identify the sense in which, after forgiveness, the victim has moved on and no longer holds the wrong against the perpetrator. We have considered the view that the forgiver now has more positive feelings towards the wrongdoer. Either as an alternative to this claim or in addition to it, some philosophers say that, after forgiving, the victim thinks about the wrongdoer in a different way. This might include holding new, more positive judgments or beliefs about the wrongdoer, paying attention to different features of the wrongdoer, or having a different quality of will towards the wrongdoer. All of these could be described as the victim reframing the wrongdoer or seeing the wrongdoer differently (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 43).

First, let us consider changes in judgment or belief. The orthodox view is that the forgiver continues to believe that she was wronged by the perpetrator, and that the perpetrator had no good excuse. If this is correct, then it cannot be these judgments that change with forgiving. Hampton claims that forgiving includes a change from judging that the wrongdoer is “rotten or morally indecent” to judging that he is a decent person with whom you could renew a relationship (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 83; also see Govier 1999: 60). Griswold agrees, adding that the forgiver must drop any “presumption of decisive moral superiority” over the wrongdoer (2007a: 54). Hieronymi claims instead that that the forgiver must form a new belief that the wrong no longer conveys a threatening message and hence no longer needs to be protested by the victim (Hieronymi 2001: 546; cf. Pereboom 2021: 89). Critics have argued that none of these changes in judgment are an essential part of forgiveness. According to these critics, we can forgive while still judging that the wrongdoer is a bad person overall and should be avoided at all costs (Hughes 1993: 337; Allais 2008: 45; Garrard and McNaughton 2011: 99). We can forgive regardless of what we believe about the message conveyed by the wrong action (Russell 2023a: 101).

Instead of adopting more positive beliefs, perhaps the forgiver changes her pattern of attention, choosing not to dwell on the fact that the forgiven person is a wrongdoer, but to focus instead on the fact that he is a rational agent who is deserving of respect and who is capable of change (Allais 2013: 646; Ware 2014: 249). Another possibility is that forgiveness includes a positive change in the quality of will that forgiver bears towards the wrongdoer. We could conceive of the victim’s good or ill will in terms of what the victim desires for the wrongdoer. The idea that the forgiver must bear good will or benevolence towards the wrongdoer goes back to Butler (1726; see also Roberts 1995: 300; Garcia 2011: 14). Several philosophers endorse the view that the forgiver shifts from ill will to good will, or that the forgiver wants things that are good for the wrongdoer to happen to the wrongdoer (Downie 1965: 133; Garrard & McNaughton 2010: 23). Zaibert and Nelkin say instead that forgiveness is compatible with bearing sustained ill will towards the person whom you have forgiven (Zaibert 2009: 387; Nelkin 2013: 174).

4.4 Forgiveness and Behaviour

The idea that forgiving consists in no longer thinking or feeling negatively about the wrongdoer strikes some philosophers as misguided or, at least, incomplete. To these critics, forgiveness crucially includes treating the wrongdoer more positively than one otherwise would have done. On this view, forgiveness is not just a matter of internal emotions and beliefs, but of external behaviour. There is much disagreement as to which kinds of negative behaviour are counteracted by forgiveness (e.g. revenge, blame, punishment), and as to how forgiveness counteracts these behaviours. Some assume that forgiving counteracts these negative behaviours in the sense that, if a victim continues to seek revenge (or to blame, or to punish), then that victim has not forgiven the wrongdoer after all (Russell 2023a: 143). But others claim that forgiveness counteracts certain negative behaviours in the sense that the forgiver merely commits not to engage in those behaviours. This would allow for the possibility that a victim has forgiven the wrongdoer but then continues to exact revenge on him, thereby breaking her own commitment but not undermining that fact that she has forgiven him (Warmke 2016b: 689; Cornell 2017: 267; Bennett 2018: 229).

Which kinds of negative behaviour are counteracted by forgiveness? An extremely common claim, going back at least as far as Butler, is that a victim who has forgiven no longer seeks to take revenge on the perpetrator (Butler 1726; Griswold 2007a: 54; Konstan 2010: 12). However, it is not at all clear what counts as revenge (Russell 2023a: 55). If revenge is nothing more than retributive punishment that is imposed by the victim herself, then we might conclude that a victim who has forgiven no longer imposes either revenge or punishment on the wrongdoer (Zaibert 2012: 104). Yet most philosophers who claim that forgiveness is incompatible with revenge also insist that forgiving is compatible with continuing to punish the wrongdoer (e.g. Walker 2006: 156; Garrard and McNaughton 2011: 99; Warmke 2013: 919). We can make sense of this combination of views if we instead take revenge to be the essentially resentful or hostile imposition of retribution (Murphy 2003: 17), or the imposition of retribution out of personal concern rather than out of an impartial desire to see that justice is done (Tosi & Warmke 2017: 265). This would allow that a victim who has forgiven cannot continue to impose essentially personal or resentful retribution, but can continue, with calm disinterest, to punish the wrongdoer.

It is also frequently claimed that forgiving is incompatible with continuing to engage in overt blaming or shaming of the wrongdoer and continuing to ask the wrongdoer for apology (Calhoun 1992: 84; Walker 2006: 166; Griswold 2007a: 53; Warmke 2016b: 689). These negative behaviours, it seems, are ways in which a victim might continue to hold the wrong against the wrongdoer, and hence are barriers to forgiveness.

While there is widespread agreement that forgiveness counteracts revenge, blaming, and shaming, there is deep disagreement as to whether the victim’s having forgiven the wrongdoer for φ is compatible with the victim’s continuing to punish the wrongdoer for having done φ. The Oxford English Dictionary includes ‘pardon’ in its definition of ‘forgive’ and it can be argued that a victim who continues to punish the wrongdoer continues to hold the wrong against the perpetrator has not really moved on. Philosophers who claim that forgiveness includes the forbearance of further punishment include Twambly (1976: 84), Swinburne (1989: 87), Londey 1986: 4), Calhoun (1992: 84), Lang (1994: 114), Hieronymi (2001: 551), Zaibert (2009: 387), Gert (2010: 98), and Bash (2015: 53). Russell claims that forgiving is compatible with continued punishment, but only if that punishment is accepted by the wrongdoer, and hence the two are no longer in conflict over the wrong (2016: 712). If either a punishment-forbearance or a no-conflict view of forgiveness is correct, then forgiving unrepentant wrongdoers will sometimes be morally costly. This is because the forgiver must withhold some kinds of punitive resistance from an unrepentant wrongdoer, even though these kinds of resistance typically serve to protect the victim and other members of the community against the risk of reoffence (Russell 2023b: 253). Hence, most advocates of punishment-forbearance accounts of forgiveness claim that, in some circumstances, victims of wrongdoing morally should not forgive (e.g. Richards 1988: 82; Hieronymi 2001; Zaibert 2009: 382).

In contrast, many philosophers think that the victim can and sometimes should forgive the wrongdoer while continuing to impose punishment on him (e.g. Mabbott 1939: 158; Murphy & Hampton 1988: 158; Holmgren 1993: 347; Hughes 1993: 337; Govier 1999: 59; Garrard & McNaughton 2011: 99; Allais 2013: 650; Nelkin 2013: 184). This view is attractive to those who believe that it is permissible or even virtuous for all victims of wrongdoing to forgive, regardless of repentance. If forgiving is compatible with continuing to punish the wrongdoer, then the victim can forgive while still protecting herself and others in the community against the risk of reoffence. Critics claim that this account of forgiveness cannot make sense of the common claim that forgiveness brings peace and allows victim and perpetrator to move on and make a fresh start (Russell 2023a: 83). For further discussion of the relationship between punishment and forgiveness, see Griswold (2007a: 32–33), Pettigrove (2012: 117–121), Tosi and Warmke (2017); and Warmke (2011; 2013).

Another dispute concerns the relationship between forgiving and reconciling. These concepts are distinct. Clearly, two estranged people can reconcile via excusing or justifying the hurtful actions that drove them apart, rather than via forgiving. However, there is deep disagreement as to whether forgiving necessarily includes reconciliation between victim and wrongdoer. Philosophers who assume that forgiveness does require reconciliation include Wilson (1988: 534), Calhoun (1992: 84), Lang (1994: 114), Konstan (2010: 13). This would limit the situations in which forgiveness is possible and would make it impossible to forgive someone after they are dead. Strabbing claims that forgiveness entails merely being open to reconciling, and that a victim can be open to reconciling with the dead (2020: 541). Most philosophers hold the opposing view, claiming that a victim can forgive while failing to reconcile, or even refusing to reconcile with the wrongdoer (e.g. Kolnai 1973/4: 94; Holmgren 1993: 342; Garrard and McNaughton 2011: 98; Pettigrove 2012: 15; Zaragoza 2012: 616). This would allow for the possibility that, after a broken romance, the two former lovers could forgive each other but go their separate ways rather than maintain any kind of ongoing relationship. Failure to reconcile does not imply that the two parties remain in conflict over the wrong, so philosophers who think that forgiveness is incompatible with continued conflict can also claim that forgiveness does not require reconciliation (Russell 2023a: 156).

4.5 Performative Accounts

The views of forgiveness canvassed thus far have focused on forgiveness as involving a positive change in the way that the forgiver feels about the wrongdoer, or in the way that she thinks about the wrongdoer, or in way the that she behaves towards the wrongdoer after having forgiven him. But perhaps forgiveness is better understood by focusing on what happens when the victim says ‘I forgive you’ or some cognate expression (Haber 1991: 29). Drawing on J.L. Austin’s theory of speech acts, some philosophers have claimed that the victim performs a range of illocutionary acts when uttering ‘I forgive you’. For example, when a victim sincerely says ‘I forgive you’ she performs the behabative act of revealing to the wrongdoer that she believes she was wronged, but that she has overcome her resentment (or, at least, is in the process of doing so) (Haber 1991: 40; Pettigrove 2004a: 379; also see Austin 1962 [1975]: 160). Pettigrove claims that in addition to functioning as a behabitive, ‘I forgive you’ can also function as a commissive act; that is, it commits the speaker to forswear hostile reactive attitudes and retaliation toward the wrongdoer and to treat her with an appropriate level of benevolence (2004a: 385).

It is possible to hold these views about the nature of the utterance ‘I forgive you’ while still believing that forgiveness consists in a positive change in the victim’s feeling, or attitudes, or subsequent behaviour towards the wrongdoer, a change that can take place independent of any such utterance, and that can fail to have taken place despite the victim having said ‘I forgive you’. In contrast, some philosophers have claimed that the victim sincerely saying ‘I forgive you’ to the wrongdoer is a declarative speech act which makes it the case that the victim has forgiven, even if the victim subsequently continues to feel deeply resentful (Nelkin 2013: 172–4; Warmke 2015: 497; Cornell 2017: 263; Bennett 2018: 208). Perhaps sincerely saying ‘I forgive you’ is one way of forgiving (Norlock 2009: 97; Cornell 2017: 250), or even the central and paradigmatic way of forgiving (Warmke 2016b: 691; Bennett 2018: 212).

According to these philosophers, forgiving is closely analogous to promising, or pardoning, or cancelling a debt (Warmke 2023: 263). Each of these actions counts as the exercise of a normative power (Owens 2012: 4; cf. Hart 1961: 43). On this view, forgiveness is a communicative action via which the forgiver chooses to alter the operative norms governing the interaction between victim and wrongdoer (Swinburne 1989: 85; Cornell 2017: 244; Bennett 2018: 216). Perhaps when the victim forgives the wrongdoer she releases the wrongdoer from the obligation to continue apologizing and making up for it (Nelkin 2013: 177), and the forgiver creates new obligations for herself to withhold further blame (Warmke 2016b: 690), and possibly to withhold further punishment (Cornell 2017: 244–5). According to Warmke, if the victim forgives the perpetrator but subsequently continues to blame or to seek revenge, then the victim has now wronged the perpetrator. This makes sense if, in the act of forgiving, the wrongdoer chooses to place herself under new obligations not to do these things (Warmke 2016a: 575).

Critics have argued that forgiveness frequently does not alter norms in these ways, and hence that forgiveness is not the exercise of a normative power. For example, when a victim forgives a wrongdoer who has already apologised and completely made up for it, or when she forgives a victim who is already dead, it is not plausible that the victim is waiving obligations owed to her by the wrongdoer (Russell 2023a: 133–140). Similarly, a normative powers view of forgiveness struggles to make sense of the fact that forgiveness is frequently uncommunicated, and that many victims strive unsuccessfully to forgive despite having sincerely uttered the words ‘I forgive you’ (Govier & Verwoerd 2002: 97; Ryu & Sewell: forthcoming). Advocates of a normative powers view can address some of these objections by claiming that forgiveness requires more than just carrying out the speech act (Scarre 2016: 936; Griswold 2007a: 53), or by conceding that only some acts of forgiveness are norm-changing performatives, while others might be mere changes in feelings or attitudes (Bennett 2018: 212; Cornell 2017: 244). But if forgiveness were sometimes a communicative action which changes norms and other times a mere change in emotion, then very frequently it would be unclear what follows from the fact that the victim has forgiven the wrongdoer (Russell 2023a: 148). If the normative implications of forgiveness are unclear, then it seems less likely that forgiveness can play its role as a peacemaker.

4.6 Pluralist Accounts

As we have seen, there is deep disagreement as to the nature of forgiveness. Some philosophers have argued that forgiveness is just too diverse and diffuse of a practice to be captured by a simple, singular theory (Neblett 1974: 273). Smith observes that our “notions of forgiveness seem to identify a loose constellation of interrelated meanings among various beliefs, judgments, emotions and actions” (2008: 134). In the face of this disagreement, philosophers might claim that there are multiple different things that deserve to be called forgiveness, and that we should simply distinguish them from each other rather than try to find out which one is the real forgiveness. This approach has been described as conceptual pluralism (Russell 2023a: 72). For example, Adams thinks that “performative forgiveness” and “forgiveness from the heart” (1991: 294) are genuine but distinct things that are both forgiveness. Similar claims have been made by Lang (1994: 108), Zaibert (2009: 385), Milam (2017: 62) and Norlock (2017: xx).

Another option is to offer a Wittgensteinian ‘family resemblance’ account of forgiveness that is centred on paradigm cases, and that allows for a wide periphery of similar cases that also count as forgiveness, but to a lesser extent (Warmke 2016b: 691). Advocates of this approach must explain why the chosen central cases count as being more fully forgiveness than others. Is it because they are more morally admirable than other cases (Griswold 2007a: xvi), or because they fit best with deliberative norms concerning forgiveness (Warmke & McKenna 2013: 200), or because they are the cases in which forgiveness fulfills its function, or because they are more common than the peripheral cases, or because they are most widely recognized by ordinary people to be cases of forgiveness? A family resemblance account which takes forgiving the dead, for example, to be a paradigm case will differ greatly from a family resemblance account which treats it as peripheral.

Some philosophers reject conceptual pluralism and instead aim to provide a more traditional unitary definition of forgiveness. Advocates of narrow versions of a unitary account are required to say that a huge number of cases that are frequently described as instances of ‘forgiveness’ do not really count as forgiveness (e.g. Downie 1965: 129; Calhoun 1992: 77; Hieronymi 2001: 534; Zaibert 2009: 387). If we instead offer a comparatively broad but unified definition of forgiveness, we will allow a more diverse range of phenomena to count as forgiveness (e.g. Cornell 2017: 244). This would make room for various kinds of forgiveness, so long as each kind falls under the broader single definition.

5. Non-Standard Kinds of Forgiveness

So far, we have focused on forgiveness between a single victim and a separate human wrongdoer. Forgiveness is also frequently described as occurring in what we might call non-standard cases: forgiving oneself, God’s forgiveness of humans, and forgiveness by or of a group of people. There is dispute as to whether these phenomena ought to be treated as genuine instances of forgiveness.

5.1 Self-Forgiveness

Outside of the discipline of philosophy, talk about forgiving yourself is almost as common as talk about forgiving others. Therapists and celebrities routinely recommend self-forgiveness (Milam 2017: 52). At first glance, the idea that you can forgive yourself seems no more contentious than the claim that it is possible to blame yourself or punish yourself. Perhaps forgiving yourself consists in first feeling some combination of guilt and self-directed anger in light of your own perceived wrongdoing and then removing these self-blaming attitudes while still judging that you did wrong and had no good excuse (Milam 2017: 55). Forgiving yourself, so-conceived, would be one way of attaining inner peace and moving on from your own wrongdoing. Despite the widespread talk of self-forgiveness, some philosophers believe that there is no such thing. Arendt says that “nobody can forgive himself” (1958: 243), and Downie claims that when a wrongdoer says that he has forgiven himself for wronging another, the concept involved “is not the concept of forgiveness at all” (1965: 129; cf. Swinburne 2021: 134).

One reason to be sceptical about self-forgiveness is the thought that only the victim has the standing to forgive. When you wrong someone else by lying to them, you are not the victim, so you do not have the standing to forgive the perpetrator (i.e. yourself) for having lied. As we have seen in Section 3, some philosophers reject this restriction, claiming instead that suitably related third-parties also have the standing to forgive. But even if this is correct, we might still think that the wrongdoer is neither the victim nor a suitably related third-party and hence cannot forgive herself. In this case, it would be possible for her to stop blaming herself for her own wrongdoing, but this should not be classed as an instance of forgiveness.

There are several ways to defend the existence of self-forgiveness against these sceptical challenges. Arguably, it is possible for me to wrong myself, for example, by excessively sacrificing my own interests in order to serve others or by doing something that ruins my career (Downie 1965: 129; Hughes 1994: 557). In cases in which I wrong myself, I am both the perpetrator and the victim, so plausibly I have the standing to forgive myself for what I did to myself. So, it is possible to hold a victim-only view on the standing to forgive while also believing that self-forgiveness exists.

However, many philosophers also believe that a wrongdoer can and sometimes should forgive herself for wrongs that she did to others. This may seem unproblematic for minor wrongs (Hughes 1994: 558), but it opens the troubling possibility of self-indulgent perpetrators letting themselves off the hook even for cases of extreme wrongdoing, forgiving themselves rather than apologising and trying to make up for the atrocities that they have committed (Kolnai 1973/4: 106). We might simply acknowledge this possibility and then morally criticise these self-serving self-forgivers. In contrast, some philosophers say that self-forgiveness is possible only when certain other justifying conditions have been met. Perhaps the wrongdoer has the ability to forgive herself only when she has felt sufficient shame (Williston 2012: 68), or only when she has apologised, repented and fully compensated the victim, and the victim wrongly refuses to forgive her (Holmgren 1998: 82). Maybe she has the standing to forgive herself when the victim is dead and hence unable to offer her well-deserved forgiveness (Griswold 2007a: 123), or when she no longer bears ill will towards the victim and hence is not a fitting target of self-blame (Milam 2017: 61). Forgiving yourself might be justified when continuing to blame yourself for your wrongdoing would be psychologically debilitating or would undermine your self-worth (Snow 1992: 76: Holmgren 1998: 90).

5.2 Divine Forgiveness

The topic of God’s relation to human wrongdoing is an important one in mainstream Western theological and philosophical discussions of forgiveness. Many theists believe that God forgives humans and that forgiveness is in the nature of God (Bash 2007: 105). Theists who believe that God forgives humans have asked questions about the nature of God’s forgiveness and about its degree of similarity to human forgiveness.

If divine forgiveness of humans is possible, what is its nature? One option is to see God’s forgiveness as including a change in God’s emotions. Perhaps God forgives by overcoming the resentment that he feels towards sinners while still judging that those sinners are culpable wrongdoers. Minas, however, claims that God could not feel resentment because a perfect being could not have a feeling of personal injury in response to wrongdoing (Minas 1975: 147; cf. Warmke 2017a: 5). Perhaps instead God forgives us by first suffering when we do wrong, then by rejoicing when we repent (Drabkin 1993: 235). However, if God is impassible (i.e., God is unable to suffer or have reactive emotions), God’s forgiveness could not take this form, either (Gavrilyuk 2004).

Alternatively, some theists believe that God forgives by forbearing punishment. For example, Londey claims that forgiveness crucially involves the remission of any penalty or sanction that a wrongdoer is due (1986: 5; cf. Brien 1989: 35; Geuras 1992: 65). Strabbing argues that God forgives by being open to reconciliation with humans (2017). Swinburne suggests that God’s forgiveness is akin to the forgiveness of a kind of debt: when God forgives us, the guilt that our wrongdoing incurred is wiped away (1989). Critics have claimed that none of these theories are plausible theories of forgiveness, because each one picks out something – mercy, reconciliation, debt-cancellation – that is separable from forgiveness (see Warmke 2017b).

Some theists claim that we humans ought to forgive each other in emulation of God’s having forgiven us (cf. Downie 1965, 134). However, if God is very different to humans, then it might be misguided or dangerous for humans to model their behaviour on that of a forgiving God (Tombs 2008: 592). For example, perhaps it is dangerous for us to forgive unrepentant wrongdoers, but not dangerous for God to do so. Similarly, if the shared sinful nature of humans gives us a reason to forgive one another, then God’s forgiveness of humans would not be justified in the same way as human forgiveness of other humans (Williams 2008: 584–585). (See also Brien 1989; Scheiber 2001; Bash 2015.)

5.3 Group Forgiveness and Political Forgiveness

Many cases of forgiveness occur in political contexts but nonetheless feature individual human wrongdoers and an individual human victim. The political setting – including considerations involving ongoing conflict and oppression – may change the nature of the wrongdoing and may provide extra reasons for or against forgiving (Bell 2009: 168; MacLachlan 2009: 192; Garrard and McNaughton 2010: 1; Cherry 2023: 89; Bell 2023: 337). Nonetheless, there is no great difficulty in fitting these cases into a standard account of interpersonal forgiveness. However, the language of forgiveness is sometimes used in political contexts in which either the forgiver or the wrongdoer is a group of people rather than an individual person. For example, we might ask whether the American people could forgive former President Clinton for lying to a grand jury, whether Indigenous Australians as a group could forgive those who invaded and colonised Australia, or whether victims of child sexual abuse by Catholic priests could forgive the Church. According to a deflationary reading, all that we are asking is whether, say, a high proportion of individual Americans could forgive Clinton (cf. Pettigrove 2006: 491). In contrast, some philosophers claim that groups can forgive and can be forgiven as groups (Govier 2002: 86; Radzik 2009: 181; Stockdale 2023: 394).

As we have seen, there is great disagreement as to which key properties must be possessed by the forgiver in a normal interpersonal case of forgiveness. Some say forgivers must be able to feel emotions such as resentment, to revise beliefs in light of reasons, and to make commitments to act in certain ways. When we ask whether group forgiveness is possible, there are additional disagreements over the following claims:

1. Group forgiveness is possible only if a group can possess the same key properties as individuals who forgive and are forgiven
2. Groups can in fact possess the requisite properties that are required for forgiving or being forgiven (whichever those properties happen to be)

Griswold endorses (1) and rejects (2). He maintains that normal interpersonal forgiveness can occur only when the victim feels negative reactive attitudes including resentment and then removes those negative emotions in response to the wrongdoer’s remorse and apology (2007a: 41, 52). Since a group of people cannot feel an emotion such as resentment as a group, Griswold argues, groups are not the kind of thing that can forgive (2007a: 142). Nonetheless, Griswold claims, groups sometimes do engage in a related but distinct process which he calls political apology and reconciliation. Notable examples include the Truth and Reconciliation Commission in South Africa (Tutu 1999; Griswold 2007a: 136; Allais 2008: 40; Cherry 2023: 65) and the German Chancellor’s 1951 apology on behalf of Germany to the Jewish people for Nazi war crimes. (See also Brooks 2004; Biggar 2008).

Some philosophers think that the process described by Griswold as ‘political apology and reconciliation’ actually is a species of forgiveness. We could argue for this conclusion by endorsing both (1) and (2); that is, claiming that at least some groups do possess the same key properties as individuals who are capable of forgiving, and hence that these groups also can forgive. Perhaps a suitably structured group of humans – a corporation, a government, a committee – can be an agent, and hence hold beliefs and make decisions and commitments as a group (Govier 2002: 86; List & Pettit 2011: 39; Smith 2021: 156). If so, then a suitably structured group which has been wronged can assess evidence of remorse and repentance in the wrongdoer and can then resolve to withhold further blame and punishment and to reconcile (Radzik 2009: 186). If this is all that is required for forgiveness, then this group can forgive as a group. If forgiveness necessarily includes changes in emotions, advocates of this approach would also have to claim that a group can feel an emotion as a group (Govier 2002: 91; Pettigrove 2006: 493; cf. Stockdale 2023: 398). Even if we accept this possibility for suitably structured groups, we might conclude that many loosely configured groups – including, say the American people, or Indigenous Australians – lack the coordinated structure required to count as an agent, and hence are not the kind of thing that can forgive (cf. List & Pettit 2011: 40).

We could take an alternative path to the conclusion that group forgiveness is possible by denying (1) and endorsing (2). For example, we could claim that ordinary interpersonal forgiveness requires a change in emotions in the forgiver, but that forgiveness by political groups is much more similar to mercy, pardon, or the waiving of a moral debt, all of which can occur completely independent of emotions (Digeser 2001: 29; cf. MacLachlan 2012: 37; Stockdale 2023: 402). Yet if forgiveness by individuals is systematically and radically different to forgiveness by groups, it will be tempting to conclude that so-called group forgiveness, along with the so-called the forgiveness of financial debts, is better treated as a separate phenomenon, governed by different norms and playing a different role in our lives (cf. Tosi & Warmke 2017: 212).

6. The Ethics of Forgiveness

6.1 Moral Disagreements about Forgiveness

Forgiveness is praised by the major world religions and frequently encouraged in the secular tradition of therapeutic psychology and the self-help movement. Some Christians believe that we have been commanded to forgive all who wrong us. Nonetheless, there is persistent disagreement as to when and why a victim ought to forgive, and as to whether forgiveness is virtuous. We will consider these issues in turn.

First, though, it is important to note that some of these moral disagreements rest on deeper disputes as to the proper definition of forgiveness. For example, imagine that two philosophers agree that a specific victim is morally permitted to abandon her resentment, but morally ought to continue to impose punishment on the unrepentant wrongdoer. Suppose that one of these philosophers thinks that forgiving necessarily includes the withholding of further punishment (e.g. Zaibert 2009: 387) whereas the other takes forgiveness to be compatible with the imposition of further punishment (e.g. Garrard 2002: 153). These two philosophers will disagree as to whether it is morally permissible for this victim to forgive this wrongdoer, yet, given their different conceptions of forgiveness, it seems that both are actually recommending the same course of action to the victim. In order to distinguish substantive moral disagreements from merely linguistic disagreements, we must pay close attention to the specific conceptions of forgiveness that are being employed by those who are making moral claims about whether a victim should or should not forgive (Russell 2023a: 70).

6.2 Criticism of Forgiveness

A few philosophers have claimed that forgiveness is always morally wrong or always morally inferior to alternative options. A perfectionist might hold that whatever attitudes or actions we overcome or forbear in forgiveness were not morally good in the first place. Perhaps to feel resentment in the face of wrongdoing is to show moral weakness, or maybe resentment is a deplorably vindictive, transactional, and self-righteous response to having been wronged (Nussbaum 2016: 5). If either of these claims were correct, then the best thing that a victim could do is not to resent and forgive, but to rise above it and not feel resentment in the first place. Griswold argues that something like this perfectionist scheme can be found in the ancients from Plato, Aristotle, the Stoics, and the Epicureans (2007a: 2–14). And though his views on what we now call forgiveness are complicated, Nietzsche might be understood as “seeing forgiveness as part of a moral system that must be rejected in toto” (Griswold 2007a: 15; cf. Blustein 2014: 23–30).

There are several ways to argue against the view that forgiveness is always morally flawed. We might accept that resentment is always immoral, but assert that instant forgiveness is possible, and that the ideally forgiving person forgives without getting angry in the first place (Pettigrove 2012: 3). A more common response, though, is to claim that resentment is often both morally fitting and useful, and that often a victim ought to first feel resentment and engage in blaming behaviour, then move past it to forgiveness (Hieronymi 2001: 530).

Another critique of forgiveness is put forward by philosophers who are sceptical of moral responsibility and blameworthiness (e.g. Pereboom 2014). Arguably, the victim who forgives necessarily still judges that she was wronged and that the perpetrator is culpable. If no one is ever culpable, then every act of forgiveness would include a mistaken moral judgment. The responsibility sceptic might concede that forgiving is morally better than blaming and punishing, but would still say that forgiveness is essentially flawed.

Kekes maintains that forgiveness is never justified (2009: 501, cf. Kolnai 1973/4). He thinks that forgiveness is possible only if the wrongdoer is blameworthy, but so long as the wrongdoer is blameworthy, the victim has reason to blame rather than forgive. Defenders of forgiveness might concede that a forgiver must judge that the wrongdoer is blameworthy, but insist that this means merely that the wrongdoer had no good excuse and is answerable for what he did. The forgiver need not judge that the wrongdoer ought to be blamed and censured forever, even if he changes his ways or makes up for what he did (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 24; Hieronymi 2001: 545). Some philosophers argue that blameworthiness may provide reasons that merely justify blame without requiring blame, and that forgiveness is also justified by the blameworthy wrongdoing (Allais 2008: 61; Warmke & McKenna 2013: 206; Pettigrove 2021: 74).

6.3 Strong Endorsement of Forgiveness

It is more common for people to take a morally positive view of forgiveness. Some go so far as to endorse unconditional forgiveness. They say that forgiveness is morally good, no matter what. However, the meaning of this claim is far from transparent. One point of clarification concerns the kind of positive moral quality that is ascribed to forgiveness. For example, forgiving might be said to be obligatory, or right, or good, or supererogatory, or virtuous, or praiseworthy, or merely permissible (Gamlund 2010: 541; Garcia 2011: 17). Some have claimed that forgiveness has the unusual moral property of being ‘elective’ or gift-like, meaning that it is never obligatory for a victim to forgive, and always permissible for a victim to forgive (Calhoun 1992: 79; Allais 2013: 644; Fricker 2022: 45; for the contrary view see Griswold 2007a: 63; Milam 2018: 574; Russell 2023a: 106).

In addition to the question of which positive moral property is universally possessed by forgiveness, we must distinguish between the following two kinds of universality claim (Russell 2023a: 76):

1. Universal positive evaluation: every instance of forgiving has the relevant positive moral quality (e.g. is good, or is right, or is virtuous)
2. Universal recommendation: every victim of culpable wrongdoing morally ought to forgive those who wronged them (or, it would be virtuous or praiseworthy for every victim of wrongdoing to forgive)

Let us say that someone who asserts one or both of these claims is strongly endorsing forgiveness. The most wholehearted supporters of forgiveness would claim that every instance of forgiveness is morally good, and that every victim of wrongdoing ought to forgive. For example, they might believe that God has commanded us to forgive all who wrong us, and that God approves of every act of forgiveness.

It is more common for philosophers to endorse one of these two universality claims while rejecting the other. Let us consider universal positive evaluation; that is, the claim that every instance of forgiveness is morally good. Philosophers who hold this view typically think that goodness or virtuousness is an essential part of the content of the concept of forgiveness, and that any similar act or process that is not morally good would thereby count as condonation rather than forgiveness (Kolnai 1973/4: 96; Hieronymi 2001: 530–531; Griswold 2007a: 51; cf. Swinburne 2021: 138). Most of these philosophers reject universal recommendation. They think that every act of forgiveness is good, but that forgiveness is possible only when certain contingent conditions have been met by the victim and the wrongdoer. For example, they might claim that, by definition, forgiveness is done for morally good reasons and with a proper appreciation of the nature and scale of the wrongdoing (Griswold 2007b: 276). If they also believe that forgiveness necessarily includes the removal of punishment or conflict, they might say that forgiveness can occur only when the wrongdoer is apologetic and repentant (Lang 1994: 106; Griswold 2007a: 52), or only when the wrong action no longer makes a threatening claim (Hieronymi 2001: 548). These philosophers think that forgiveness is morally good whenever it occurs, so in some sense they believe that forgiveness is unconditionally good. But clearly these philosophers are not recommending that every victim should forgive, regardless of apology and repentance. Rather, they think that a victim who is confronted by a dangerous unrepentant wrongdoer cannot forgive.

In contrast, some philosophers endorse universal recommendation while rejecting universal positive evaluation. They agree with Garcia’s claim that “we are morally obligated to forgive all wrongdoers” (2011: 17) or Downie’s view that “it is always good to forgive” (1965: 134) or, at least, that it is morally permissible for every victim of wrongdoing to forgive (Calhoun 1992: 79; Garrard & McNaughton 2011: 104; Pettigrove 2012: 100; Allais 2013: 644). This implies that forgiveness is permissible regardless of whether the wrongdoer has repented and apologised, but it does not imply that every act of forgiveness is done well or done for the right reasons (Pettigrove 2012: 115). Advocates of this view might claim that some victims forgive for selfish reasons or without having appreciated the significance of the wrong done to them, and hence that their acts of forgiveness are far from virtuous and may even count as facile or deplorable (Garrard & McNaughton 2011: 105; Pettigrove 2023: 364). Arguably, victims who forgive in these flawed ways are failing to embody self-respect (Holmgren 1993: 341). However, if universal recommendation is true, then there must have been a morally good reason for forgiving that was available to every one of these facile forgivers, a reason that they failed to act upon.

Several such universally present reasons have been posited by philosophers. Perhaps the fact that the wrongdoer is our fellow human being gives us sufficient reason to forgive him (Garrard 2002: 164). Alternatively, perhaps the reason is provided by the fact that the wrongdoer is a rational agent who is capable of reform (Govier 1999: 70). If forgiveness is always a generous gift that is beneficial to the wrongdoer, this could count as an ever-present reason to forgive (Allais 2013: 648). Maybe the fact that the victim herself is also a wrongdoer on other occasions gives that victim a good reason to forgive those who have wronged her (Lang 1994: 115; Roberts 1995: 298). In one sense, these philosophers endorse unconditional forgiveness; they think that a morally good act of forgiveness is available to every victim regardless of whether the wrongdoer apologises and repents. Yet they also believe that some acts of forgiveness are morally flawed and blameworthy. Thus, there is also a sense of the phrase ‘unconditional forgiveness’ according to which these philosophers do not endorse unconditional forgiveness.

6.4 Cautious Endorsement of Forgiveness

So far, we have considered two strongly opposed normative views: the view that forgiveness is always morally flawed or wrong, and the view that forgiveness is always morally good or always called for. Many philosophers position themselves between these extremes, claiming that in some cases of wrongdoing it is morally good for victims to forgive and often victims forgive for good reasons, but other times victims forgive in situations where it would be wrong for any victim to do so (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 32; Milam 2018: 583). People who occupy this middle ground uphold a cautious and conditional ideal in relation to forgiveness. They point to several kinds of pro tanto reason that count in favour of forgiving and several kinds that count against forgiving. In certain contexts, the balance of reasons decisively favour forgiving, but when the details of the situation are different, the balance of reasons might call for the victim not to forgive (Roberts 1995: 293; Russell 2019: 283). (The reasons that count against forgiving are reasons for the victim to continue to do something that is incompatible with forgiving: perhaps reasons to continue to resent, or to blame, or to enforce punishment, or to refuse to reconcile.)

Some philosophers have claimed that the extremity of the initial wrongdoing impacts on the permissibility of forgiveness, independent of any subsequent repentance or apology by the perpetrator. Perhaps there are atrocities or evil actions that are so wrong that they are unforgiveable come what may (Russell 2018: 222) or maybe forgiveness of even the worst evildoing can be justified (Govier 1999: 71). It is commonly believed that it is permissible to forgive minor wrongs without waiting for repentance or apology.

The fact that the wrongdoer has acknowledged the wrongdoing, repented, apologised, and compensated the victim is typically counted as a reason in favour of forgiving (Allais 2008: 37). Some claim that forgiving can still be justified in the absence of these things, say, as a generous gift or as a beneficial peace-making move (Pettigrove 2012: 138). Others maintain that forgiving can be justified only if the wrongdoer has had a change of heart (Milam 2019: 247). This intuition could be grounded in an appeal to the victim’s self-respect (Haber 1991: 90; Novitz 1998: 299; Griswold 2007a: 64–5) or in the requirement to take morality seriously (Murphy & Hampton 1988: 24). Alternatively, it could be grounded in an appeal to retributive justice or considerations of what the wrongdoer owes to the victim. Perhaps the wrongdoer must earn forgiveness by doing these things and can deserve to be forgiven only by discharging his reparative obligations (Griswold 2007a: 69). Some think that, if a wrongdoer has done all of these things, then the victim is now morally obligated to forgive (Hieronymi 2001: 552; Griswold 2007a: 67). Others say that these reparative actions count as reason to forgive but never make it obligatory for victims to forgive. In support of this, they claim that it is never appropriate for an apologetic wrongdoer to demand to be forgiven (Allais 2013: 642; cf. Griswold 2007a: 68). Another justice-related reason that might favour forgiving is the fact that the wrongdoer has been punished, either by the state, the community or by the victim herself (Russell 2024: 48). According to Murphy, the fact that the wrongdoer has already suffered enough is a reason that favours forgiving (Murphy 2003: 51; cf. Hallich 2013: 1006).

The consequences that flow from choosing to forgive or not to forgive might also provide reasons for or against forgiving. If forgiving increases the happiness of the victim by allowing her to shed the burden of resentment and resistance or by removing the victim from dangerous conflict with the wrongdoer, this would count as a prudential reason to forgive (Arneson 2021: 291). Some philosophers say that these considerations carry no moral weight in relation to the morality of forgiveness (Hallich 2013: 1008), but others take them to be morally relevant, if not decisive. Similarly, if being forgiven raises the wellbeing of the wrongdoer, this might count as a pro tanto reason for the victim to forgive (Pettigrove 2012: 139). In the same vein, so-called proleptic forgiveness is given to an unrepentant wrongdoer in the hope of inducing him to repent and reform (Kolnai 1973/4: 102; Murphy & Hampton 1988: 30; Griswold 2007a: 121) and might be justified if it actually succeeds in this aim (Russell 2019: 279). Forgiveness is often touted as a beneficial peace-making move in situations of entrenched conflict (Pettigrove 2012: 139; Arneson 2021: 293), allowing cooperation to be reestablished and to persist (Ingram 2013: 1078).

However, all of these appeals to the good consequences of forgiving must be weighed up against any bad consequences. The question of which, if any, bad outcomes are produced by forgiveness depends not only on the context of any given case, but also on which behaviours are assumed to be incompatible with forgiveness. As we have seen, some philosophers believe that a forgiver must subsequently withhold further blame and punishment (Hieronymi 2001: 551) or must remove herself from conflict with the perpetrator (Russell 2016: 712). Others say that the forgiver must reconcile with the wrongdoer (Wilson 1988: 534). When the wrongdoer is repentant and reformed, it will usually not be dangerous to do these things. However, when the wrongdoer is an unrepentant repeat offender, making peace and reconciling are likely to put both the victim and other members of the community at greater risk. On this view, forgiving is sometimes morally wrong because in some cases forgiving facilitates reoffence (Russell 2023a: 86; cf. Pettigrove 2012: 122). This points to another reason why apology and repentance count in favour of forgiving: they provide some evidence that the wrongdoer no longer poses a serious risk of reoffence, and hence that it is safe for the victim to forgive and cease resisting the wrongdoer. Philosophers who uphold a cautious and conditional ideal in relation to forgiveness think that forgiveness is sometimes deserved and sometimes beneficial, but sometimes so dangerous as to be morally wrong.

6.5 Forgiveness and Virtue

We have seen that at least some individual acts of forgiveness can be judged to be virtuous in the sense of being morally right, well-motivated, and embodying ethical excellence. Some philosophers have suggested that people who forgive well thereby manifest a single virtue, such as justice, or mercy, or love (Pettigrove 2023: 366–73; cf. Lippitt 2020: 88). However, evaluations of acts of forgiveness often include appeals to a variety of specific virtues and vices. Forgiveness of an unapologetic wrongdoer could manifest the virtues of generosity, love, and compassion, although some such acts of forgiveness might be accused of expressing the vices of injustice and recklessness. Forgiveness of a repentant and apologetic wrongdoer could manifest the virtues of justice and self-respect. Similarly, someone who refuses to forgive a repentant wrongdoer might be criticised for manifesting the vices of vindictiveness or self-righteousness.

Rather than merely evaluating acts of forgiveness in terms of other virtues, many philosophers claim that there is a specific moral virtue that is called forgiveness (Downie 1965: 128–9; Kolnai 1973/4: 104; Holmgren 1993: 350; Griswold 2007a: 113; Warmke 2015: 503). Roberts calls this virtue “forgivingness” (1995: 289). Arguably, this is not equivalent to Aristotle’s virtue of mildness (1125b31–2; see Griswold 2007a, 4–5) or to Stoic invulnerability (Griswold 2007b: 283) or to the Christian virtue of charity, all of which have much wider scope than anything that could plausibly be called the virtue of forgiveness. Not all proper management of anger counts as forgiveness and not all generosity or beneficence counts as forgiveness.

If there is a virtue of forgiveness, there is deep disagreement as to its nature. Some of these disagreements map onto previously discussed disputes as to which individual acts of forgiveness are morally right and well-motivated. For example, one possible virtue of forgiveness would be the stable character trait of not even getting angry in response to having been wronged, but responding unconditionally with generous goodwill in a way that manifests self-respect (cf. Pettigrove 2012, 3). According to this view, the person who has the virtue of forgiveness forgives all who wrong her and does so for a good reason.

Others claim that the virtue of forgiveness consists in a character trait that disposes its bearer to respond to being wronged by first resenting and blaming and by removing these negative reactions when and only when the right reasons fall into place, say, when the wrongdoer has apologised and repented (Griswold 2007a: xv; cf. Roberts 1995: 293). It is easy to position this purported virtue of forgiveness between an associated vice of deficiency (i.e. not forgiving enough, being vindictive) and an associated vice of excess (forgiving too readily, or condoning wrongs that ought to be resented and resisted). However, advocates of this view must claim that sometimes a victim manifests the virtue of forgiveness by refusing to forgive, a claim which may create confusion. Russell proposes that we avoid this confusion by abandoning the idea that there is a virtue of forgiveness. He suggests instead that the relevant virtue in this domain is that of responding well to having been wronged, a virtue that sometimes manifests in forgiveness, but in other cases manifests in a justified refusal to forgive (Russell 2023a: 175).

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Other Internet Resources

• The Forgiveness Project.
• Philosophy Bites Program on Forgiveness, interview with Lucy Allais (UC-San Diego).
• Philosophy Bites Program on Derrida and Forgiveness, interview with Robert Rowland Smith.
• Interview with Luke Russell on punishment and forgiveness, Youtube channel of The Philosopher (journal of the Philosophical Society of England).
• Anger, Forgiveness, and Moving on, a discussion between Glen Pettigrove and Luke Russell, The Philosophy of Living Well.
• Forgiveness: Do We Need It?, lecture by Lucy Allais, Youtube channel of The Royal Institute of Philosophy.
• When Should You Forgive, interview with Brandon Warmke, Youtube channel of Brain in a Vat.
• Interview with Pamela Heironymi, Youtube channel of Dr. Sahar Joakim.

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