B. The Science of Forgiveness

For much of the history of modern psychology, the topic of forgiveness was largely ignored. Piaget (1932) discussed the capacity of forgiveness so far as it is related to the development of moral judgment. Litwinski (1945) produced a study on the kind of affective structure that would provide one with a capacity to forgive. Emerson (1964) was the first to explore the association of forgiveness with mental health, and Heider (1958) proposed an early working definition of forgiveness (as the forgoing of vengeful behavior). Rokeach (1973) promoted forgiveness as a valuable form of conduct, but didn’t say much about its nature. Discussions of forgiveness as it relates to Prisoner’s Dilemma situations and tit-for-tat strategies were not uncommon (e.g., Gahagan & Tedeschi 1968)—the idea being that forgiveness could be likened to a cooperative move following a competitive move.

In the recent decades, forgiveness has enjoyed a significant increase in empirical attention (McCullough, et al. 2000: 6, 7). Important early work during this time included papers by Boon and Sulsky (1997), Darby and Schlenker (1982), and Weiner, et al. (1991). Yet even after decades of sustained empirical enquiry, psychologists remain divided about how forgiveness ought to be defined (Worthington 2005, 3) .

Some psychologists forward interpersonal models of forgiveness. According to these approaches, forgiveness is an activity involving communication (perhaps verbal, perhaps not) between agents. Reconciliation-based models of forgiveness developed out of research in evolutionary psychology and evolutionary ethics (Sapolsky & Share 2004; de Waal & Pokorny 2005; Axelrod 1980a,b). According to these views, forgiveness evolved as a mechanism for affirming mutual cooperation between agents after an act of defection.

Others have sought to define forgiveness by way of intrapersonal models. According to these models, forgiveness occurs within one’s skin, as it were. DiBlasio’s (1998) decision-based model views forgiveness “as an act of the will, a choice to let go or hold onto” resentment, bitterness and the need for vengeance (1998: 76). McCullough and various colleagues have posited a motivational model that understands forgiveness as a process involving a decrease in motivations to avoid or seek revenge, and an increase in benevolent and conciliatory motivations (e.g., McCullough, Fincham, & Tsang 2003). Cognitive models conceive of forgiveness as a reframing of the narrative about the transgression, the transgressor and the forgiver (e.g., Gordon, Baucom, & Snyder 2000; Thompson, et al. 2005). One forgives by changing one’s assumptions, beliefs, standards, or perceptions about the wrongdoer and the wrongdoing. Emotion-based models see forgiveness as being accomplished by the replacement of negative, unforgiving emotions (e.g., anger, hatred) with positive, other-oriented emotions (e.g., empathy) (Worthington 2003; Malcolm & Greenberg 2000).

Still others have suggested mixed models, according to which forgiveness has both interpersonal and intrapersonal modes or aspects. Baumeister, Exline, and Sommer (1998) suggest that when one feels forgiving towards an offender but does not communicate as much, one has silently forgiven. Alternatively, when one does not feel forgiving but tells the offender that she is forgiving her, she accomplishes hollow forgiveness. When one both feels forgiving and tells the offender so, she has accomplished full forgiveness. Enright and Fitzgibbons (2000) have argued that in order to forgive, cognitive, affective, and behavioral changes must be made.

As it should be clear, there is significant disagreement about the nature of forgiveness in the psychological sciences, leading one prominent psychologist of forgiveness to write that “no consensual definition of forgiveness exists” (McCullough, et al. 2000: 7).