Philosophy of Psychotherapy

In 1895, Josef Breuer and Sigmund Freud published Studien Über Hysterie (Studies on Hysteria), a series of case studies describing a new method of treatment for patients suffering from various psychological and somatic symptoms (Breuer and Freud 1895). One of the subjects, Breuer’s patient “Anna O.” (Bertha Pappenheim), characterized this method as the “talking cure.” Today, “psychotherapy” is the preferred term for a wide array of clinical interventions that address psychological symptoms, covering not only talk therapy, but also play therapy, art therapy, drama therapy, music therapy, bibliotherapy, and animal-assisted therapy. According to one recent estimate, there are as many as five hundred different modalities of psychotherapy (Eisner 2000).

In addition to these diverse modalities, a diverse array of professionals provide psychotherapy: psychiatrists, clinical psychologists, licensed clinical social workers (LCSWs), and licensed professional counsellors (LPCs). Each has slightly different forms of training, licensure requirements, and distinct professional organizations with specific standards for ranking quality of evidence for effective care. Psychotherapy has become increasingly popular in the U.S. and around the world. In the U.S., expenditure for psychotherapy showed an increase of 65% (from $30.8 billion to $51.0 billion), between 2018–2021, reversing a nearly 20-year downward trend (Olfson et al. 2025).

Given this diversity, one might wonder what – apart from the label – all psychotherapies have in common. Is there a principled way to demarcate what falls within psychotherapy? Is this practice unified by any particular form of “expertise”? If so, what exactly is expertise in psychotherapy? Relatedly, what should successful psychotherapy aim to achieve? How ought we to measure achievement of this goal (or goals)? What counts as effective, or “evidence-based” practice? Does psychotherapy harm? These are just a few of the conceptual and methodological questions that have shaped nearly a century of debate (see, e.g., Freedheim 1992; Dawes 1994; Wampold and Imel 2015).

Philosophers have made significant contributions to these debates. Most early work by philosophers of science was dominated by skirmishes over the scientific status of psychoanalysis (Hook 1959; Popper 1963; Grünbaum 1984, 1985, 1986, 1993; Edelson 1983, 1984, 1985, 1986a, 1986b, 1986c, 1990; Erwin 1980, 1984c, 1985, 1993, 1995, 1997a, or more recently, on psychodynamic therapies, see, Jopling 2008). However, there are a much wider array of open questions concerning the methods, goals and clinical practice of psychotherapy generally, to which philosophers have increasingly made contributions. These questions overlap with longstanding philosophical debates surrounding the concepts of function and dysfunction, mental health, illness, disability, well-being, measurement in science, evidence, the value-free ideal, “knowledge that” versus “know how,” the social dimensions of science, and the conceptual and explanatory relationships between the sciences, particularly sciences of mind, and behavior, and biology.

Professional ethics and matters of justice will not be the central focus of this entry. Instead, the focus will be on conceptual and methodological debates surrounding psychotherapy. Ideally, philosophical reflection on these questions will be of benefit to psychotherapists, and not only philosophers. Weimer (1980) refers to psychotherapy and philosophy of science as a vivid example of a “two-way street in search of traffic.”

• 1. What is Psychotherapy?
• 2. Does it Work? How Do We Know?
  • 2.1 The Placebo Problem
  • 2.2 Evidence-Based Therapy
  • 2.3 Case Studies and the Hermeneutical Turn
• 3. How Does it Work?
  • 3.1 Attachment
  • 3.2 Cognitive Behavioral Therapies
• 4. Harm
• 5. Mental Health and Well-being
• 6. Future Directions
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. What is Psychotherapy?

Art therapy, dance therapy, eye movement desensitization and reprocessing (EMDR), cognitive behavioral therapy (CBT) and psychedelic assisted therapies (PAP) endorse quite different theories about both their methods and goals. Digital mental health interventions (DMHIs) are – some say – at best forms of guided self-help, rather than forms of psychotherapy. This diversity of practices raises some fundamental questions concerning what falls within the scope of “psychotherapy.” Is there a principled way to define this domain?

Consider the following definition:

Psychotherapy is interpersonal treatment that is (a) based on psychological principles; (b) involves a trained therapist and a client who is seeking help for a mental disorder, problem, or complaint; (c) is intended by the therapist to be remedial for the client disorder, problem, or complaint; and (d) is adapted or individualized for the particular client and his or her disorder, problem, or complaint. (Wampold 2015, 37)

This definition leaves open many questions, some conceptual and some methodological: What features are required for a psychotherapeutic intervention to be “interpersonal”? Which interventions count as “treatment”? What counts as a “psychological principle,” and when is a treatment “based” on such principles? What is sufficient to qualify a therapist as “trained”? Which sorts of “disorder, problem, or complaint” warrant psychotherapy? When is a therapy suitably “individualized”?

Consider the term “interpersonal.” On a thin, literal reading of Wampold’s definition, “interpersonal treatment” could simply mean any activity that involves two or more persons. Such a relationship might seem by definition impossible with DMHIs, though there is some dispute about what counts as a “person,” and whether DMHIs might count, as well as whether an interpersonal “alliance” can be formed in such contexts (Beatty et al. 2022; Darcy et al. 2021). To those who hold that the interpersonal relationships between two people are essential to the psychotherapeutic process (see, e.g., Horvath & Greenberg 1994; Flückiger et al. 2012, 2018; Norcross and Lambert 2018), it would seem that an interaction with a DMHI simply could not qualify as “psychotherapeutic,” or at least, not in the same way. According to Newman and Hayes: “Although it is conceivable that a human being may have feelings and attitudes toward a phone, tablet, or computer, the reverse is not true. In the absence of reciprocal feelings and attitudes, one may conclude that a relationship cannot be present” (Newman and Hayes 2024). Whether (or how) this particular kind of reciprocity matters to therapy, and how, is a long-contested issue in psychotherapy research and clinical practice (Norcross & Lambert, 2018), to which we return below.

“Training” is likewise contentious: Must one have some formal training to qualify as a “psychotherapist”? One famous study (Strupp & Hadley 1979) appeared to demonstrate that professors without professional training in psychotherapy achieved similar outcomes to professionals in the treatment of (largely, depressed, anxious) undergraduate men – though, according to one of its authors, “At best, one can conclude that, under special circumstances, college professors can be effective therapists” (Strupp 1991, p. 312). Indeed, it seems that extent of professional training does not necessarily correlate with effective care (see, e.g., Dawes 1994). That said, there is evidence that clinical experience, at least, can improve outcomes, though how it matters, and to which outcomes, is a matter of dispute (Tracey et al. 2024). Depending upon the professional degree, credential and licensure requirements, standards for training in psychotherapy can be quite varied. Most training programs require a graduate degree, up to several thousand hours working under supervision, as well as a professional certification, typically after a comprehensive examination (as well as continuing education). Whether “lay” therapists (those without professional degrees) qualify has been a matter of dispute ever since Anna Freud was permitted to offer psychoanalysis after finishing her analysis with her father (Young-Bruehl 2008).

No less contentious is the matter of what warrants the descriptor of “treatment.” Many who seek psychotherapy qualify as “subclinical,” or their symptoms may not warrant a diagnosis by the lights of the DSM (the Diagnostic or Statistical Manual of Mental Disorders) or ICD (International Classification of Diseases). Of course, many physicians treat patients for conditions that would not qualify as illness or disease (e.g., pregnancy). Nonetheless, in order to be reimbursed, most clinicians are required to assign patients a diagnosis. But the matter of whether psychotherapists ought to describe their task as offering “treatment” of illness, or “enhancement” has not been entirely resolved.

Perhaps this is in part why psychotherapy is best described (according to Wampold) as an “individualized” activity. Differences between individuals – their unique experience and history – matter rather a good deal to how (and how effectively) psychotherapy proceeds (Norcross and Wampold 2011). Of course, what would likely benefit a child of five struggling with autism will be quite different from what would benefit an adult with intermittent depression. How, and how much, diagnosis matters to one’s method or mode of intervention is a matter of long dispute.

Wampold also requires that psychotherapy rest on “psychological principles.” Which principles, exactly, support or inform psychotherapy practice? Is basing psychotherapy on general principles in tension with a focus on the individual? Psychological principles could refer to generalizations about human development, patterns of cognition, affect, or behavior, or associations between clinical interventions and outcomes. Which such principles matter, and how to ground psychotherapy in them, is a matter of dispute among different schools (e.g., cognitive behavioral, psychodynamic), which endorse different theories about the fundamental causes of suffering, and thus also, best means of intervening (Woolfolk 1998, 2015; Cuijpers et. al. 2023).

Such theories have, in turn, shaped the longstanding controversy over what counts as “evidence-based” psychotherapy. Competing directives from different professional societies complicate the matter (see Society of Clinical Psychology, Treatment Options in Other Internet Resources). The American Psychological Association, Cochrane Database, National Institutes of Health, and the National Association for Clinical Social Workers, each provide their own assessments and ranking of evidence-supported psychotherapies. Perhaps not surprisingly, there have been lasting disputes surrounding how best to study psychotherapy technique and effectiveness (Strupp and Howard 1992; Garfield 1992; Lilienfeld et al. 2003).

Whichever definition of “psychotherapy” one favors, it seems yet further conceptual and methodological questions inevitably arise. Thus, how best to assess what falls under the purview of “psychotherapy” in some sense cannot be fully addressed without also engaging prior philosophical questions about the nature of interpersonal relationships, psychological principles and their relationship to clinical practice, the relevance of diagnosis to treatment, and ideals and realities of evidence gathering in the sciences. Below, we will consider a few of these questions as they bear on psychotherapy research and practice. We close with a consideration of future directions.

2. Does it Work? How Do We Know?

The question of whether “psychotherapy works” is a somewhat vague one. One could be asking whether there is an overriding pattern of results in the clinical (research) literature suggesting that the psychological therapies are effective (absolute efficacy). Or one could be asking whether, on average, treatments shown to be efficacious in clinical trails also perform well in real world conditions (effectiveness). Or one could be asking whether the psychotherapies are cost-effective, construed in terms of which doses of care, over which length of time, have the greatest response. Alternatively, one might ask whether any one therapy is consistently more effective than any others (relative efficacy), more effective for specific conditions (e.g., depression, anxiety, OCD, PTSD, etc.), or more effective than pharmaceuticals.

The short answer to the first, most general, question above is “yes.” Or, at least, over the past fifty years, hundreds of clinical trials, metaanalyses, and systematic reviews attest to psychotherapy’s effectiveness (Barkham and Lambert 2021; de Jong & DeRubeis 2018; Cuijpers et al. 2023). With respect to the latter questions, there are a variety of competing views. Some claim that the cognitive and behavioral therapies have been consistently shown in clinical trials to be more effective than other modalities. Others argue, to the contrary, that the differences between techniques or modalities are insignificant. The latter view is sometimes referred to as the “Dodo bird verdict” (see section 2.1). Notably, the empirically supported psychotherapies have been shown to be as efficiatious as medications, at least for nonpsychotic patients (Hollon et. al. 2021).

A good deal of the remaining controversy hinges on debates over how to systematically study psychotherapy outcomes and processes. Indeed, some of the first metaanalyses were conducted in this domain, exactly because of concerns about overall benefit (Smith and Glass 1977; Smith et al. 1980). Metaanalyses in this domain have faced a variety of challenges, apart from the standard file drawer, apples and oranges, and garbage in, garbage out problems facing any metaanalysis. In particular, there are challenges concerned with inclusion and inclusion criteria, especially whether wait-list controlled studies are legitimate, and for which purposes, and debates over how to adjust and compare effect sizes. Some argue that uncontrolled bias shapes even our best estimates of psychotherapy’s overall effectiveness, which range from standardized mean difference (SMD) of 0.20–0.30 to twice this amount 0.700 (Munder et al. 2019). In sum, there are a variety of open questions surrounding psychotherapy research. Here, we provide a brief overview of the broad issues at stake and then consider specific methodological and conceptual debates and how and why they emerged.

At least three central conceptual and methodological challenges face clinical research in psychotherapy. First, a standard picture of ideal experimental tests involves holding controlled factors fixed and selectively intervening on experimental variables. However, psychological variables (affects, beliefs, desires) are tightly intertwined, or “fat handed” (Eronen 2020). This makes psychotherapy research especially difficult. Consider the role of expectation. Evidence suggests that belief in the effectiveness of an intervention seems to play a significant role in positive outcomes (Frank 1961; Wampold and Imel 2015). Controlling for this (and many other, potentially confounding) factors may indeed be impossible. Thus, whether we can isolate and measure the effects of specific psychotherapeutic interventions from various “common factors” (therapist effects, client effects, interactive effects, etc.) has been a matter of lasting dispute.

Second, what count as meaningful (and comparable) outcome measures is contested. One can take patient surveys at different points in the therapeutic process, in service of measuring different kinds of outcome, some of which may matter more or less to understanding what is most beneficial to patients, over the short or long term. Prioritizing one measure over another in service of assessing psychotherapy’s overall effectiveness is, arguably, a value-laden choice, one that can have rather significant consequences for research. For instance, a recent paper listed are at least ten major classes (and many more subclasses of different operationalizations) of psychotherapy outcome one could measure in a clinical trial: (1) client-rated assessments of the working alliance or (2) real relationship, (3) client-rated multicultural competence, (4) rates of engagement in therapy (percentage of clients who return after intake)/dropout rates, (5) reports of clinically significant change by clients, therapists, significant others, or observers using measures of symptomatology, (6) interpersonal functioning, (7) quality of life/well-being, (8) self-awareness/ understanding/acceptance, (9) satisfaction with work, or (10) behavioral assessments (e.g., fewer missed days of work, fewer doctor visits) (Hill et al. 2017). Their point was to illuminate how, depending upon which among these outcomes one chooses to prioritize as measure of the effectiveness of a therapist, one might arrive at very different judgments as to the relevance of various forms of “expertise” in psychotherapy to positive outcomes. Outcome measures range over short and long term, patient reported, or otherwise. Nonetheless researchers have attempted over the years to develop a variety of “objective” outcome measures, from the Health-Sickness Rating Scale (Luborsky 1962), to the Global Assessment Scale (Endicott et al. 1976)

Third, there is what is sometimes called the “idiographic” problem: Some contend that the very idea of putting all individuals with a given condition into a common treatment is flawed. Each individual’s mental state is a result of a combination of causes, experiences, and conditions that will not precisely recur in any other individual. Thus, even psychotherapeutic interventions that adhere to very precise manuals are (arguably) not genuine “replications” of exactly the same kind of causal interaction. Each patient and therapist is unique, as are the dynamics between them. These complex psychosocial interactions make it especially difficult to assess whether treatments shown to be effective by the lights of a clinical trial (Erwin 2006) are likely to be effective for patients unlike those in the trial.

2.1 The Placebo Problem

Philosophers have played an important role in the history of this dispute. Most famously, Popper and Grünbaum questioned the scientific status of psychoanalysis, though each in quite different ways. Popper argued that psychoanalytic theory was unfalsifiable (1963). Grünbaum (1984, 1985, 1986) argued that psychoanalytic hypotheses were falsifiable and had been falsified. Grünbaum’s critique of psychoanalysis was massively influential (and, has larger implications beyond psychoanalysis), so it is worth unpacking in some more detail.

According to Grünbaum’s reading of Freud (though, see, e.g., Sachs 1991), psychoanalysis effects a cure by identifying (repressed) unconscious states that are the source of symptoms, and offering an interpretation of such states. True interpretations would yield insights, in turn, yielding resolution of conflict. But, Grünbaum argued, inferences to unconscious states are fallible, and thus any apparent benefit of purported insights from such interpretations may well be a matter of mere placebo or wish fulfillment. Edelson (1984, 48) presents a nice reconstruction of Grünbaum’s reading of Freud as follows:

a) Premise 1. Psychoanalytic therapy is only successful if the analysand achieves veridical insight (not pseudoinsight but objectively true knowledge of himself), and he achieves veridical insight only if the interpretations of the psychoanalyst tally with what is objectively true.

b) Premise 2. Psychoanalytic therapy is successful.

c) Conclusion. Therefore, the analysand achieves veridical insight – and so the psychoanalytic interpretations not only seem true to the analysand …, but are objectively true as well.

Grünbaum takes there to be little evidence to support premise 1 or 2. Any apparent success in psychoanalysis may be due to causes apart from provision of an accurate interpretation – “spontaneous” recovery, unwitting suggestion on the part of the analyst, the shared belief of the analyst and analysand in the efficacy of psychoanalysis.

For our purposes, the interest of this argument lies not in its critique of psychoanalysis. Rather, the interest lies in the general form of the argument, which has implications for any form of psychotherapy. It has been a concern for all forms of psychotherapy that apparent improvement in clinical outcomes could well be due to the strength of belief or power of suggestion (Hovda 2019). Indeed, Grünbaum’s argument echoes similar (and much older) arguments in the clinical literature (e.g., Rosenzweig 1936), going back to worries expressed by Freud himself (see, e.g., Sulloway 1992).

Rosenzweig (1936) is most famous for identifying what came to be called the “common factors” of psychotherapy and characterizing what came to be called the “Dodo bird verdict.” Citing Lewis Carroll (“all have won and all shall have prizes”), Rosenzweig noted that defenders of psychotherapy’s effectiveness often make arguments that have the form of post hoc ergo propter hoc fallacies – the patient is better, so it must have worked! Each, however, offer up different explanations as to the method that did the work. He suggested an alternative; it could well be the “common factors” shared by all therapies that did the work, and among such factors may well be prior belief in therapy’s effectiveness (or, for that matter, the persuasive methods of the therapist). This reduced psychotherapy’s effects to the power of suggestion – features Rosenzweig noted were shared with mesmerism, and faith healing.

In other words, Rosenzweig was raising a similar worry to that of Grünbaum: Could one “common factor” shared by psychotherapy, mesmerism, and faith healing be the central cause of positive outcomes? Indeed, was the most common common factor mere “strength of belief” – i.e., placebo? This line of argument has led to decades of dispute (see, e.g., Frank 1961, 1973, 1993). A good deal hangs upon how we define “placebo.” According to Miller et al. 2009:

“placebo effect” is a generic name for beneficial effects that derive from the context of the clinical encounter, including the ritual of treatment and the clinician-patient relationship, as distinct from therapeutic benefits produced by the specific or characteristic pharmacological or physiological effects of medical interventions… a placebo intervention is not necessary to elicit it. The placebo effect may accompany and enhance the effectiveness of medical interventions with demonstrated specific treatment efficacy. Moreover, the communicative interaction of practitioners with patients, both verbal and nonverbal, may produce placebo effects even without the use of discrete treatments.

There’s been a vast literature on the psychological and neurobiological mechanisms of placebo in this broader sense, and in the context of psychotherapy (Benedetti 2009; Howick 2017 2023; Chiffi et al. 2017, 2021; Gaab et al. 2018). Theories of how the placebo effect works include “expectation, conditioning, and anxiety reduction” (Miller et al. 2009). (Indeed, Freud himself referred to the “transference cure” as roughly, a performance of health on the part of a patient, as an expression of a desire to please the analyst, thought to be common in those whose parents’ love was conditional, and so required similar performance.) Depending upon how one understands placebo, it is either a complicating factor in psychotherapy, or essential to effective care.

On the one hand, it is relatively uncontroversial that some “contextual” factors, such as a patient’s social support network, financial stability, and trust in, and working alliance with, the therapist, are all strongly predictive of positive outcomes (Wampold & Flückiger, 2023). Promoting this sense of alliance has been described as “activating the placebo.” But is this exactly the same as promoting psychotherapy’s effects by “mere” persuasion?

Rosenzweig was neither the first, nor the last, to raise skeptical worries along these lines. In 1952, Eysenck infamously compared patients in a clinic who exhibited “spontaneous recovery” with others who sought therapy and argued that there “appears to be an inverse correlation between recovery and psychotherapy” (Eysenck 1952, p. 322). Eysenck’s paper led to a lasting preoccupation with how to establish psychotherapy’s overall effectiveness, and whether it was tied to clinical knowledge, or know-how, or both (Rosenzweig 1954; Luborsky 1954; Smith, Glass and Miller 1980; Meehl 1954; Dawes 1994).

In short, worries such as Rosenzweig’s led to a long tradition of concern surrounding the evidence for, and effectiveness of psychotherapy, the absolute and relative effects of distinct psychotherapeutic interventions, the common factors, the role of placebo, the nature of clinical expertise, and which outcome measures are meaningful. These broad disputes eventuated in two competing trends (Edelson 1985). On the one hand, there was an effort to shore up the scientific credentials of psychotherapy via standardization of “evidence-based” methods. On the other hand, there was a movement resisting these very standards of evidence. Section 2.2 will address efforts to develop “evidence-based” psychotherapies; section 2.3 will look at responses that push back against the emphasis on “evidence-based” practice.

2.2 Evidence-Based Therapy

Evidence-Based Medicine, also known as EBM, is a particular paradigm defended and developed by a Canadian researchers in the 1990s (Solomon 2011). Defenders of EBM originally ranked different types of evidence in a hierarchy (Guyatt et al. 1992; Sackett 1997), taken to represent the relative quality and reliability of different kinds of evidence in medicine. The EBM hierarchy ranks randomized control trials (RCTs) and systematic reviews above non-randomized controlled studies, case studies, mechanism-based reasoning, and “clinical intuition.”

The hierarchy, has, however, been the target of considerable philosophical criticism. Some philosophers argue that mechanism-based reasoning is just as important as statistical evidence in warranting causal claims in medicine (Russo & Williamson 2007; Clarke et al. 2014). Others argue that randomization is neither necessary nor sufficient for adequately supporting a causal claim, given that it’s practically impossible to ensure that the treatment and control groups are entirely homogenous with respect to all possible confounding factors (Cartwright 2007, 2010; Worrall 2007). (See the entry on medicine.)

The analogue to EBM in psychotherapy is “Evidence-based Practice,” or “Evidence-based Psychotherapy Practice,” EBP, or EBPP, which prioritizes evidence drawn from metaanalyses and randomized controlled trials. The rationale for relying on metaanalyses is that the method is cumulative and comparative, allowing researchers to not only synthesize results, but track effects over time, as well as summarize the relative impact of different therapies to one another or a benchmark. The locus classicus of metaanalyses in clinical psychotherapy is Smith, Glass and Miller’s (1980) study, which many took to demonstrate for the first time the overall efficacy and effectiveness of the the psychotherapies.

There is a specific suite of concerns that have been raised about exporting this EBM framework to psychotherapy. Critics have drawn attention to a variety of methodological challenges, apart from the particular concerns surrounding placebo, mentioned above.

1. Weak / Poor Study Design: Study designs for psychotherapy, some claim, have several systematic flaws. When researchers randomize clients to a control, depending on choice of control, it may fall far short of the intervention tested. For instance, patients on the wait list for therapy are treated as “controls.” Some claim that this is not analogous to a “control” condition. Some worry about how clinical trials of various modalities often treat therapist effects as “random” variables; that is, they assume that any difference in outcome due to differences among therapists in their effectiveness will “wash out.” However, recent research has suggested that when such effects are taken into account, therapist effects may exceed the differences in effects due to different treatments or specific ingredients of various therapies, rendering such results insignificant (Wampold & Owen 2021). Others worry that therapists trained in the comparator to a favored modality may be inadequately trained or instructed to not engage in ways that artificially bias results in favor of the (preferred) modality (Wampold & Imel, 2015). Researchers tend to have allegiance to their preferred method, and it’s been demonstrated that when and if there is an allegiance on the part of researchers, the outcomes are more often (and more significantly) in favor of their preferred approach (Munder et. al. 2011). All of the above render results of many such studies questionable.

2. Contested Outcome measures: As discussed above, what we measure, when we measure the effects of psychotherapy, is not uniform across different research contexts, and choices are subject to various forms of bias, making any claims to effectiveness that combine these results potentially problematic. By way of vivid illustration of the debate over whether, or how, the objectivity of outcome measures can be compromised in assessments of treatment effectiveness, consider the dispute over whether or how to include patient perspectives, via patient-reported outcome measures (PROMs) (Truijens et al. 2021; Kious, 2021).

3. The Heterogeneity/Comorbidity problem: Many patients are diagnosed with the same condition are quite heterogeneous in their presentation of symptoms, and comorbidity is ubiquitous. That is, patients often exhibit symptoms of multiple disorders, such that they fall into more than one category (McGrath et al. 2020). This makes studies that exclude patients with comorbidity potentially irrelevant to many naturalistic contexts. Moreover, even when therapists adhere to manualized therapeutic techniques tested in a given clinical study, the distinctive features of each therapeutic interaction make it especially difficult to determine whether and how the psychotherapeutic intervention per se was causally relevant (Erwin 2006).

In short, there are a variety of challenges facing any randomized clinical trial of psychotherapy, ranging from issues arising from the nature of the intervention itself, to the measures of outcomes, to designing studies that enable one to intervene in precise ways, and avoid confounding causal factors.

Many further factors apart from the “specific ingredients” of a modality and the alliance are known to play an important causal role in improved outcomes – simple time and distance from the experiences that may have led to symptoms and thus seeking therapy, the setting of care, as well as circumstances of the client (their extent of social support, economic security, physical health, etc.). These are among the many “common factors,” or “non-specific factors,” labeled as such because they are “common” to all modalities of therapy, and according to some, play the most substantial role in therapy’s effectiveness (see also Fancher 1995; Hovda 2019).

Some contend that “evidence based” talk is merely rhetorical, aimed at pacifying government bodies or insurance administrators concerned with the costs of care. This cynical view may seem uncharitable, but concern with costs of care were used to support a national health care “evidence based” psychotherapy program in the UK, the IAPT program, now called the “NHS Talking Therapies for Anxiety and Depression” (see, e.g., Clark 2011). In the U.S., most insurers will cover all and only “evidence-based” approaches. Might there be other tools for evaluating and improving the quality of care, which are more appropriate, given the nature of psychotherapy as a clinical practice?

2.3 Case Studies and the Hermeneutical Turn

Some of the most famous early instances of psychotherapy were described using narratives of particular patients’ experiences. Some dispute the epistemic value of case studies, but others contend that they are a key feature of psychotherapy training, provided various conditions are in place (see, e.g., Forrester 2017; Kaluzeviciute and Moreton 2023; Tekin 2025; Ylikoski & Zahle 2019). This section considers the roles, scope and limitations of case studies in clinical training and research.

Clinical narratives are still used in many research and pedagogical contexts in psychotherapy. For instance, case conferences (where cases are presented in a seminar with trainees and supervisors) are a standard practice in many psychotherapy training programs (for a critique of this practice, see, e.g., Meehl 1973). Case conferences serve a variety of purposes – providing a trainee with an opportunity to “formulate” a case (a general description of what the client is struggling with), instructing other trainees in the sorts of questions to ask (or not), when to speak (and when to be silent), helping the trainee identify what they might be missing, or how to improve (see Ells 2022). Case formulation provides an illustration of the kinds of trade-offs involved in forming hypotheses about, reflecting on, or “modeling” a patient; indeed, one philosopher has suggested that this analogy between psychotherapy and modeling might suggest strategies for training young therapists (Plutynski 2024).

Some argue that case studies are tools for redirecting attention in clinical practice toward personal narratives, an underutilized resource in clinical practice. Emphasizing first-person testimonies, according to some, yields better outcomes (Tekin 2025). One can find parallels to this argument in the history of the psychotherapies, particularly among “interpersonal” psychoanalysts (Sullivan 1953; Mitchell 1998), “logotherapists” (Frankl 1960), and “existential” psychotherapists (May 1960). One philosopher dubbed this shift in emphasis the “hermeneutic turn” (Edelson 1985).

This framing of the goal of psychotherapy as “self-understanding,” or “making meaning” raises several philosophical questions. One is how to determine what ways of making “meaning” are less salubrious than others (Leder 2019). Another concerns how attention to personal narrative transforms “meaning.” A third concerns what distinctive (and distinctively advantageous) role psychotherapy plays in “making meaning”, in contrast to, e.g., making art, writing poetry, or religious observance. Might it matter, for instance, if the sense of meaning garnered from psychedelic experience in psychedelic assisted therapy is based on an illusion (see Letheby 2021)?

What evidential role might case studies legitimately play? Case studies are often deployed in somatic medicine. Philosophers have tried to unpack exactly what epistemic work cases do (Ankeny 2014; Morgan 2019, 2020; Kaluzeviciute and Moreton 2023; Ylikoski & Zahle 2019). For instance, single case studies may provide evidence in service of illustrating a principle or common pattern of behavior or cognition across many clients, highlighting a unique, special context in which a particular treatment was effective, or illustrating a typical difficulty encountered by therapists. The narrative format of cases is a particularly vivid way of illustrating common themes, insights, or challenges faced in the therapeutic encounter.

The case study approach seems to stand in contrast to the evidence-based medicine approach, not only in methodology, but in objective. The goal seems not to provide evidence that a general tool or modality is effective, but how attending to the particular narrative of an individual patient is key to effective care. Case-based approaches to instruction seem less concerned with offering general prescriptions, than offering particular accounts of how this or that intervention failed or succeeded and why, given a specific client and context, to show how and why this particular interaction was worth learning from. A philosopher who has defended the “narrative” approach to psychotherapies argues that this approach focuses on the “self” – the individual’s particular struggles (see, e.g., Tekin 2025). Though, multiple cases with common themes may also be used to illustrate a general principle, or approach.

Some psychotherapists resist the characterization of their goal as treatment of mental disorder, akin to treatment of disease in somatic medicine. “Humanistic,” existential and interpersonal therapists will sometimes suggest that the goal is to “make meaning,” find a sense of “purpose,” or enable clients to become more “free,” “autonomous,” “integrated,” or self-directed. Many such therapists resist the evidence-based approach.

For instance, Mitchell (1998) seems to endorse the falsehood of premise 1 in Grünbaum’s reconstruction of Freud’s “tally” argument. In other words, he claims that success does not depend upon whether the analyst’s interpretation is true, but is meaningful. Mitchell compares analysis to constructing a narrative, akin to the work of history. Just as there are many ways to tell a historical story about the same period in history, so too there are many adequate narratives. The credibility of an interpretation not undermined by falsehood, for the test of adequacy of an interpretation is whether it is “useful, immediately graspable, and enriching.” In his view, “the most important thing they [analysts] have to offer—[is] a method of self-reflection and participation.”

On this picture, the aim of psychoanalysis (according to Miller) is not alleviation of symptoms of disorder but finding a way of “making meaning.” The question this might raise, however, is whether therapy is distinct from other ways in which a patient might make meaning. People make meaning of their lives in a variety of ways – they meditate, write poetry, autobiography, or fiction, make art, travel, take psychedelics, or engage in religious rituals. Is there something distinctive about psychotherapy which marks it off from these other activities, according to defenders of the “hermeneutic” view?

Even within the “hermeneutic” schools of thought, are a variety of ways of framing psychotherapy’s distinctive methods, ranging from fostering autonomy, to reframing of the past, noticing how the past shows up in the present, identification of habits of emotional response, relationship dynamics, fantasies or fears, or how all of these shape one’s current behavior, affect, or cognition. Understood this way, psychotherapy is deeply and ineliminably intertwined with a narrative understanding of particular details of the patient’s life, making the application of EBM principles much more challenging than if the methods of psychotherapy are understood in much more behaviorist terms.

3. How Does it Work?

The hermeneutic turn provokes a question concerning how exactly psychotherapy “works.” At its core, psychotherapy aims to produce change – in behavior, beliefs, interpretation of experience, or some other psychological feature. To explain how psychotherapy works, therefore, requires specifying what is to be changed and how the process of psychotherapy produces that change. In offering a response to the question of what psychotherapy is supposed to change, each school of psychotherapy has sought to answer three basic questions (though the hermeneutic approach might reject the framing of these questions):

1. How do various psychological processes normally work?
2. How do these processes go wrong in ways that produce suffering?, and
3. How can what has gone wrong be corrected?

Different schools of thought will answer these questions in different ways, drawing upon competing theories of the emotions, psychological development, behavior change, evolution, and the dynamics of interpersonal relationships (see, e.g., Insel & Young 2001, Nesse 2023; Panksepp 2004; Gottman and Gottman 2017). Different approaches to psychotherapy affiliated with different models of the mind and mental functioning tend to place greater emphasis on different disciplinary perspectives – ranging from neuroscience (Panksepp & Solms 2012), to anthropology (Erikson 1963; Horney 1936), to feminist theory, or sociology (Chodorow 1989). (See the entries on psychoanalytic feminism and feminist perspectives on the self.) How may we understand the connection between the concepts and mechanisms deployed by various psychotherapy approaches and basic science (psychology, neuroscience, cognitive science, and other related fields.)?

Basic science tends to focus on the mechanisms involved in phenomena such as attention, memory, and emotional processes, and on changes in particular brain areas or neurotransmitters rather than the psychological or other causes of symptoms as typically described in clinical practice. How the development and maintenance of symptoms are connected to these other phenomena is often unknown. That is, the “mechanisms” of change in typical psychotherapeutic modalities are often very loosely tied to any psychological, cognitive, or neurological “mechanisms.” (See the entries on mechanisms in science, cognitive science, and neuroscience.)

According to Ehring et al. 2022, of forty psychological interventions that the APA Division 12 list classifies as evidence-based treatments, only 9 have been shown to display a strong link between basic research and treatment development. One of the difficulties in making this link is that basic science tends to focus on answering the first question (“How do psychological processes normally work?”) in terms of different phenomena, using different theoretical concepts, and experimental methods, than does clinical practice.

One exception is attachment theory. Attachment theory offers a good example to evaluate how basic research and clinical practice can both work together, since the concept of attachment is both transtheoretical (playing a central role in many schools of psychotherapy) and transdiagnostic (believed to play a role in the development and maintenance of many different types of psychopathology).

3.1 Attachment

While philosophers have long debated the very idea of “human nature” (see, e.g., Dupré 2001; Machery 2008; Downes 2017; Hannon & Lewens 2018), it is relatively uncontroversial that humans are distinctively social animals. Or, at least, if there is anything distinctive about how humans learn – whether learning language, communication and expression of emotions, food preparation or tool use – it is that much of it depends rather significantly on social interaction (Sterelny 2012).

Many attachment theorists trace the process of healthy psychological development (or the emergence of various symptoms of mental illness) to formative relationships with early caregivers. For instance, Bowlby, (1958, 1960, 1969), Winnicott (1958, 1960, 1965) and Ogden (2001) take the ability to place trust in others, develop healthy relationships, become independent, comfortable and at ease with oneself, to be a process of maturation, which begins in infancy. According to these authors, trust in others depends in large part on the infant’s early relationships with caregivers, such as Winnicott’s “good enough” mother – a caregiver that is “reliable,” but not too reliable, thus allowing the child to learn independence and self-sufficiency. This tradition has been critiqued, and extended, by several feminist psychoanalytic thinkers (see, e.g., the entry on feminist perspectives on the self).

Many therapists take mental suffering to be due to arrests or failures of “attachment” in healthy development. Such views are traceable to early studies of infants in orphanages, many of whom seemed to struggle to develop healthy emotional attachments later in life (Freud and Burlingham D, 1942, 1944). Without adequate provision of both physical and psychological care – i.e., not simply fulfilling physical needs – warmth, shelter, food – but also psychological needs, many children suffered difficulties that appeared to extend into adulthood. This model of psychological development, and its evolutionary bases in particular, has been contested, particularly by critics of evolutionary psychiatry. (See, e.g., the entries on evolutionary psychology and philosophy of psychiatry.)

Some envision the process of therapy as in some ways re-enacting this very same maturation process, ideally correcting for the difficulties in attachment in those who failed to develop a sense of independence and security. The “holding relationship,” on this view, is necessary for healthy relationships with others in adulthood. Therapy can provide a substitute, for those that failed to receive it. Children develop more or less “mature” “defenses” against “difficult” feelings – denial, displacement, projection, humor, etc. In the process of psychotherapy, shameful, angry, sad or otherwise difficult feelings can be acknowledged in a safe, affirming environment, and thus become less threatening or destabilizing.

Attachment theory has been highly influential in psychology. A considerable amount of basic research has focused on understanding how the attachment system works at the biological and neural levels. Very broadly, attachment is believed to involve social cognition, emotion regulation, and stress response, each of which is believed to involve particular brain regions (especially the amygdala, hippocampus, and the dorsal and ventral aspects of the prefrontal cortex). Research has suggested a role for a large number of neurobiological components including endocrine hormones (especially oxytocin and vasopressin), neurotransmitters (especially dopamine and serotonin), neurotrophins (in particular, Brain-Derived Neurotrophic Factor (BDNF)), stress hormones (including those involved in the Hypothalamic-Pituitary-Adrenal (HPA) axis), and the sympathetic nervous system (Izaki et al. 2024).

Despite the significant literature on the neurobiological basis of attachment, Izaki et al. suggest that “there is a lack of a cohesive biological narrative that explains the psychological forces shaping attachment behavior and the emergence and consolidation of attachment patterns at a neurobiological level” (2024, p. 1). Thus, (at least according to Izaki) questions 1 and 2 about how healthy attachment develops and how attachment difficulties arise are lacking a comprehensive answer. Question 3 about how difficulties with attachment can be corrected, since it depends on answers to the first two questions, also lacks a definitive answer. That said, some contend that the study of the “social brain” and the neurobiology of attachment is essential to predicting and explaining a variety of mental health outcomes, including responses to therapy (Gustison & Phelps 2022, Singer 2025). However, there are longstanding difficulties connecting cognitive functions to underlying neurological mechanisms (See the entry on philosophy of neuroscience.)

3.2 Cognitive Behavioral Therapies

This difficulty is certainly not unique to attachment theory. Cognitive Behavior Therapies (CBTs) can be divided into “first,” “second,” and “third” waves; the former evolved in part out of Skinnerian, Pavlovian, and social learning theories, and involved principles of change including classical and operatint conditioning, and reinforcement. First and second wave CBT therapies tend to target behaviors and thoughts that maintain negative symptoms, where patients are required to maintain a diary of self-monitoring of symptoms and associated thoughts. More recent, “third” wave theories include dialectical, mindfulness, and acceptance and commitment therapies, which are more ecumenical (Newman et al. 2021).

CBTs are often believed to be the gold standard therapies for many types of psychopathologies. Despite this, relatively little is known about the mechanisms by which CBTs work. Some philosophers have argued that the causal mechanisms by which CBT is purported to work are very likely wrong (Leder 2017; Ratnayake 2021, 2022). Others have defended variants of cognitive behavioral theory (Robertson 2018; Sripada 2022). This section considers a range of putative mechanisms, at the psychological, biological or neural level, reviewing the scope and limitations of research on the underlying causes.

Southward et al. (2024) identify a range of putative mechanisms by which CBTs work, including treatment specific mechanisms that directly impact specific symptoms (CBT-specific skills designed to produce cognitive restructuring, behavioral activation), transtheoretical mechanisms (therapeutic alliance, expectations about treatment, beliefs about self-efficacy), and psychopathological mechanisms (attachment style, aversive reactivity, positive affect). It is worth looking briefly at how CBT is believed to work to see not only how the earlier three questions are answered, but also to highlight an additional challenge for understanding how psychotherapy works: accounting for specific effects (specific to a given type of therapeutic intervention; type of psychopathology; or particular individual).

While other modalities of psychotherapy focus primarily on changing patterns of behavior that are maladaptive or harmful, cognitive approaches focus on “disordered” or “maladaptive thoughts”. The client is urged to record their thoughts, track how they affect their feelings, and then redirect or revise their thoughts. This is framed as a “correction” of errors – false thoughts are corrected and replaced with ones more likely to alleviate depression and anxiety. CBT ostensibly works then by redirecting of thoughts and feelings toward less ruminative, negative thoughts.

Dismantling designs suggest that the behavioral elements of, or changes in behavior associated with cognitive therapy, not cognitive restructuring, may explain much of its efficacy (Dimidjian and Hollon, 2010), and other work suggests that most of the symptom reduction in cognitive therapy occurs in the first several weeks of treatment, before formal cognitive interventions have been introduced (Ilardi & Craighead 1994). That is, it may be that simply attending therapy and making a commitment to action, the process of forming an alliance, becoming more aware of the emotions, is itself what is most therapeutic in CBT.

What does it mean at the biological or neural level for thoughts or patterns of thought to be either “adaptive” or “maladaptive;” “healthy” or “disordered?” It is easier to evaluate this in the context of particular symptoms or disorders. Taking anxiety (generalized anxiety disorder) as an example, researchers believe that problematic thoughts involve misperceptions of threat and behavior and heightened emotional response to anxiety-related stimuli. Neurobiological models of anxiety propose that responses to fear and emotional regulation differ in people with anxiety disorders compared to healthy individuals. It has been proposed that pathological anxiety is associated with increased activity in limbic areas associated with bottom-up modulation and generation of fear, while activity associated with top-down control circuits in prefrontal regions is reduced (Duval et al. 2015).

Along with empirical evidence for the therapeutic effectiveness of CBT, an increasingly large number of fMRI studies have also shown changes in brain functioning following treatment (Barsaglini et al. 2014; Brooks and Stein 2015). However, the significance of these changes in neural activation remains uncertain (Schrammen et al. 2022). Some caution in interpreting these results is called for due to general problems with fMRI studies (e.g. intra- and inter-subject variability, reliability of assumptions about the neurophysiology underlying the BOLD signal (Specht 2020)).

More importantly for the evaluation of how psychotherapy might work to change dysfunctional or maladaptive thoughts is that clinically relevant symptoms such as anxiety may be only loosely connected to phenomena such as threat response that are studied in the lab (Rief et al. 2024). Insofar as CBT aims to challenge or replace or challenge maladaptive thoughts, it’s unclear whether these lab studies are altogether relevant to CBT’s effectiveness. In addition, the heterogeneity of mental disorders as classified in diagnostic manuals means that both the underlying neurobiology of anxiety and the effect of psychotherapy on a given individual may differ from what is found to be common to a group.

The focus here has been on looking at the mechanisms by which psychotherapy works, but of course it does not always work. The mechanisms involved in poor response to treatment are not well understood. Sometimes, therapy is ineffective and sometimes it can actually cause harm. The next section will address the evaluation of harm caused by psychotherapy.

4. Harm

There is a long history of evidence of harm in the treatment of psychological disorders. While what is called “treatment failure” has generally been taken to be a marker of potentially harmful treatment, there is no clear consensus on what constitutes failed treatment. Markers of treatment failure may include symptom deterioration (experienced in 5–10% of clients), non-response to treatment (experienced in up to 30% of clients), and premature end to treatment (found with almost 20% of clients) (Knox et al. 2023). However, Lilienfeld (2007) argued that many types of harm may occur in the process of psychotherapy without affecting these outcomes. These harms may involve the development of new symptoms, disruption of social bonds, changes or problems in other areas of life, unresolved damage to the therapeutic relationship, dependence or idealization of the therapeutic relationship, loss of trust in the particular course of psychotherapy, and loss of confidence in future treatment. Research on patient experiences of harm suggests that most patients report at least one negative effect during psychotherapy (Ladwig et al. 2014; Rheker et al. 2017; Moritz et al. 2019). Identification and evaluation of the potential harms of psychotherapy is made difficult, however, by both conceptual and methodological challenges (Dimidjian and Hollan 2010; Lilienfeld 2007; Rozental et al. 2018).

The central conceptual challenge is what may qualify as a “harm” (versus what might “feel” harmful and yet be a needed step to recovery). Examples of the latter are not hard to come by. Addicts, for instance, may have false beliefs – such as that they are capable of controlling their use of a substance. Confronting these beliefs may bring up negative feelings in the addict, but engaging with these negative feelings may be key to effective care. Thus, though perceived as harmful, some interventions in psychotherapy may be overall beneficial.

Though there has been increasing attention to the problem of defining “harm,” a systematic review of psychotherapy research protocols (Klatte et al. 2023) found that there was no consistency either in the terms used to discuss harm (e.g. “adverse event,” “serious adverse effect,” “negative experience,” “harm,” “side-effect”) or in how these concepts were defined in the context of psychotherapy. Part of the challenge is that established frameworks for understanding and identifying harm were developed in service of psychopharmacological trials, and so not a good fit for clinical trials on psychotherapy. For instance, the ICH Guidelines For Good Clinical Practice (2016) focus on medical consequences, not psychosocial consequences, arguably a poor fit with psychotherapeutic interventions. Lack of uniform guidelines for monitoring AEs in psychotherapy trials pushes the conceptual problem back.

Attempting to identify which changes are causally related to psychotherapy is, of course, another significant challenge. When considering symptom deterioration, for instance, it could be very difficult to determine whether these are caused by the treatment, or other life circumstances, or pre-existing conditions or predispositions. Lilienfeld (2007) argued that psychosocial harms of psychotherapy are likely to be multidimensional, and symptoms themselves can be self-reinforcing, and multicausal. The increase or decrease of some symptoms may result in the development of new symptoms, as well as affect social interactions.

Another difficulty arises from the uncertainty of the appropriate time frame to evaluate harm. Some treatments may make patients worse in the short term but produce improvement in the long term. For instance, 10–20% of patients being treated for PTSD show deterioration after beginning exposure therapy but go on to improve at the same rate as those who do not show any transient deterioration (Lilienfeld 2007). Additionally, it is not clear from whose perspective harm should be evaluated. In recent years, there has been an increasing amount of research on patient perspectives of harm in psychotherapy which has been valuable in contributing to a broader understanding of the types of harm that might occur (Arora et al. 2022; Knox et al. 2023; Vybiral et al. 2024). However, while the patient perspective provides important evidence for both efficacy and harm, distinguishing negative experiences that constitute harm from those that the patient simply disliked is not straightforward.

The second type of challenge to identifying harm is methodological. Many of the same methodological challenges with evaluating the effectiveness of psychotherapy discussed earlier also apply to evaluation of harms – problems of regression effects, self-selection bias, confounding, and extrapolation. As an example of the latter, when looking for harm, is that one ought to consider how treatments that are generally effective will often work for some patients but not others. Lilienfeld (2007) suggests that increased variance of treatment outcomes in the treatment group relative to the control might indicate that some patients are being harmed by that treatment. Given uncertainty about the universalizability of particular forms of psychotherapy to diverse populations (e.g. Arora et al. 2022; Huey et al. 2023), one might worry that harms to groups who are underrepresented among psychotherapy patients may go undetected without specific attention being paid to differential effects.

In particular, CBT’s focus on individual-level factors rather than structural factors may inadvertently cause harm to members of marginalized groups. Ahuvia and Schleider (2023) argue that a client and the therapist may have different explanations for the client’s distress, with the client attributing their distress primarily to structural factors and the therapist attributing the distress to individual-level factors. For instance, a trans client who feels that anti-trans policies have a much larger impact on their mental health than other factors (Puckett et al. 2023) might take issue with a CBT therapist, who will typically focus on the individual and interpersonal levels. As a result, the client may feel invalidated and misunderstood. Structural competency may be required to reduce the potential for harm (Kirmayer et al. 2018). It may be that harm is caused by different factors in different groups or individuals.

A final problem in evaluation of harm caused by psychotherapy is the continuing lack of attention to tracking harm in most clinical research. While the conceptual and methodological challenges described above clearly contribute to this problem, many researchers have taken seriously the need to assess harmful effects of psychotherapy (e.g. Linden 2013; Ladwig et al. 2014; Linden et al. 2015; Moritz et al. 2015; 2019). Given the current lack of conceptual consensus about harm in the context of psychotherapy, it is probably unsurprising that these instruments show considerable diversity (Herzog et al. 2019). Despite this limitation, the development of these measures has facilitated the structured evaluation of harm in research on psychotherapy (Jonsson et al. 2014; Klatte et al. 2023). As the use of digital mental health interventions increases, it is notable that harm in this context is also under evaluated (Gomez-Bergin et al. 2023; Tekin and Delehanty 2025).

5. Mental Health and Well-being

This discussion of harm points to a larger conceptual difficulty: What exactly is the aim of psychotherapy? By “mental health” do we mean simply the alleviation of symptoms of illness, or something else? How is it different from well-being? A common view is that mental health is simply the absence of mental illness. On this view, promoting mental health is equivalent to alleviating the symptoms of mental illness. This view of “health” enables one to develop relatively simple operational measures of health outcomes, in terms of symptom reduction. Alternatively, on a “positive” view of mental health (Tengland 2013), mental health is not simply absence of mental illness, but presence of a diverse set of skills, capacities, dispositions, or psychological states. Historically, these traits were often associated with “character” or “personality structure” (Horwitz 2023; Plutynski and Pouncey 2025). Such views persist to some extent in some parts of clinical research and practice. However, there has been an effort to purge value-laden concepts and measures from clinical research, increasingly modeling mental health research on research in somatic medicine.

The latter approaches conceive of the aim of intervention as the alleviation of observable symptoms in well-validated diagnostic categories. On this view, mental health is simply the absence of symptoms of disorder, thus (in principle) removing from the clinical environment any value-laden judgments. After all, clinicians should not be in the business of advising their clients on how to live, conflating psychotherapy with moral education. Indeed, many philosophers worry that endorsing a more substantive view of “mental health” in terms of positive traits or capacities risks collapsing a meaningful distinction between mental health and well-being (Keller 2019; Wren-Lewis and Alexandrova 2021; Murphy, Donovan, & Smart 2020).

Others worry that a narrow focus on symptom reduction misrepresents psychotherapy as a value-free enterprise, and risks focusing on short-term symptom relief, instead of allowing for the possibility that psychotherapy can (with time, and effort) generate substantial “structural” and “personality” changes (see, e.g., McWilliams 2013). Others bemoan a narrow focus on symptom outcomes, taking research attention away from the interpersonal processes of change in psychotherapy. For clinicians, understanding the process is at least as important as knowing that an intervention reliably yields a reduction in symptoms (Sargent 1961).

The philosophical literature on the nature of mental health, and how (or whether) it is distinct from well-being, has substantive bearing on problems of measurement, psychotherapy research and clinical practice (see, e.g., Banicki 2019; Charland 2004; Keller 2019; Leder & Zawidzki 2023; Plutynski and Pouncey 2025). At issue is whether (or how) one can avoid value-laden concepts, and if one cannot, how to do so in ways that neither pathologize mere unhappiness, or blur the line between psychotherapy and moral education. There is a related concern with testimonial injustice in this domain (see the entries on biomedicine, social epistemology, feminist epistemology, and disability and justice). A central concern with measures and definitions of mental health in this context is the extent to which patients’ perspectives may be overlooked or ignored in establishing goals for treatment and what a good life looks like for them (Bergqvist 2020; Chapman and Carel 2022; Jeppsson 2023; Kidd and Carel 2019; Tekin 2016).

Indeed, there do seem to be some skills that psychotherapy teaches that share a good deal with moral education (Charland 2004). And assessment and treatment of personality disorders seem to involve a good deal of value-judgment (Banicki 2019). Many of the core capacities, skills, or dispositions that psychotherapy teaches involve “corrective” thinking – “correcting” “false” beliefs that lead to overwhelming or problematic affective states or behaviors that do not serve the client well.

The fact of the matter is that many outcomes in psychotherapy seem irreducibly value-laden: sadness is appropriate or not, as is anger, or humor, given some context or other. What counts as a “healthy” response to a given circumstance does seem to involve some value judgments. This means that psychotherapists, and psychotherapy as a practice, requires judicious, careful attention to the patient’s values and consistent checking in on shared understanding of the patient’s goals (see, e.g., Casement 2013). Arguably, however, “value-free” validation is not applicable where a patient is presenting a danger to themselves or others.

6. Future Directions

The philosophy of psychotherapy intersects with many important questions in philosophy. Answers to questions such as what the goal of psychotherapy is and how it works are connected to questions about the nature of psychological distress or disorder. Do mental disorders necessarily involve dysfunction? If so, what kind of dysfunction? Do attempts to explain how psychotherapy works in terms of changes in functional brain activity depend on a strong biological model of mental disorder? Or is work on the neural bases of psychotherapy compatible with a more strongly social or ecological model of mental disorder? How does this affect the appropriate scope of psychotherapy? How do different social, political, or economic contexts affect the appropriateness of particular modes of psychotherapy and their potential for harm?

One important area deserving of further exploration is digital mental health interventions. These compose an array of different types of intervention – some scripted (e.g. Wysa, Rejoyn), and others relying on large language models (e.g. Therabot). The types of inputs used by these tools also varies. Digital phenotyping refers to the use of either or both active and passive data from smartphones and wearable technology to assist in diagnosis and treatment. Active data requires user engagement (e.g. entering text or selecting a response to a question) and passive data is collected without direct user input (e.g. data from smartphones or wearables about time spent online, location, heart rate, physical activity, etc.). Some argue that the great benefit of DMHIs is the potential to reach many who might otherwise not gain access to mental health care of any sort. Given the limits of current health care, some contend that access to DMHIs is better than no care at all. However, studies comparing such digital interventions show mixed results; some seem to be as effective as human psychotherapists, and others less so (Tekin 2021). As with traditional psychotherapy, there are challenges in evaluating the efficacy of these tools. One central concern of such research is whether or how the two interventions are comparable; are they indeed aiming to achieve the same thing, in anything like the same way?

There are also significant epistemic and ethical concerns with these technologies. One major worry is the potential for DMHIs to worsen existing disparities in mental health care (Skorburg and Friesen 2021; Skorburg and Yam 2022; Knox et al. 2023). Another primary concern is whether and how AI-based mental health care can help in the development of self-knowledge or self-understanding (Grodniewicz and Hohol 2023; Sedlakova and Trachsel 2023; Tekin, forthcoming). Yet another concern is whether – without sufficient human back-up – such studies carry serious risks of harm (see, for instance, Eicher et al. 2025; Moore et al. 2025). “Fail safe” tools might prevent serious harm, but they also reduce the potential for these tools to be used by enough users to fill the gap in mental health services. Intervention by human therapists in emergent situations triggered by a psychotherapy app may lead to unnecessary carceral treatment of individuals who are otherwise not at great risk. Thus, though some see enormous potential in these technologies, many others express deep concerns about their use. Some of these concerns will likely be either exacerbated or be allayed as more empirical data about the use of DMHIs is acquired.

As a growing research area, the philosophy of psychotherapy offers new ways to approach some longstanding problems as well as opening the door to many new ones.

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