Sikh Philosophy

First published Thu Feb 12, 2026

Sikh philosophy is generally considered to be a distinct tradition of thought-practice indigenous to South Asia that emerged in the fifteenth century from the writings of one of India’s major spiritual figures, Guru Nanak, better known as the founder of the spiritual path known as sikhī (lit. the path of learning) or ‘Sikhism’ as it is designated in the modern knowledge system. While not incorrect, such appeals to South Asian indigeneity belie the fact that Sikh philosophy is a composite term first appearing in the context of colonial encounters and through subsequent interactions between categories and concepts of Sikh and Western thought (Mandair 2022: 14). More specifically, Sikh philosophy emerged as a consequence of, and in relation to, the translation and reconfiguration of a foundational term in Nanak’s teaching, namely, gurmat (lit. the logic or teaching of the Guru) into the European knowledge system. It is therefore more helpful to think of Sikh philosophy as an ‘assemblage’ rather than a strictly indigenous thought-form.[1]

The fact that the colonial knowledge system initially categorised terms such as gurmat or sikhī as religion or religious (hence Sikhism), implying that they were lacking in philosophical thought, can be attributed to a combination of secular statecraft and colonial epistemic technology deployed in the governance of colonised populations. An important consequence of classifying gurmat as ‘strictly religious’ (McLeod 1998: 12) was that it legitimated the transfer of political and “epistemic sovereignty” (Hallaq 2018: 98) from the Sikh lifeworld to the modern Western knowledge system as indigenous categories sikhī and gurmat were now placed into a colonial cartography of ‘world religions’ whose underpinning logic was characterized by a transcendental metaphysics peculiar to both Christian theology and secular humanist philosophy (Masuzawa 2005; Mandair 2006).

Although Sikh elites internalised this classification of ‘gurmat as religion’ during the late nineteenth and early twentieth centuries, their interpretive efforts nevertheless managed to keep alive indigenous traditions of reflective thought-praxis, such as gurmat vichār (lit. contemplative reflection on the concepts and practice of the Guru’s teaching) gurbanī vichār (contemplative reflection on the utterances of the Guru), as well as mnemo-praxial techniques such as nām simaran (practice of meditating on the primordial vibration or nām). By the early decades of the twentieth century Sikh scholars began to recontextualize interpretations of the key Sikh concepts and contemplative practices in relation to the framework of European philosophy. As a result, the two distinct knowledge formations – the Indic ‘gurmat’ and European ‘philosophy’ – were synthesized into a new intellectual discourse known as ‘Sikh Philosophy’ (also referred to as ‘Philosophy of Sikhism’) with a rich and variegated body of literature composed in various languages: English, modern standard Punjabi, pre-modern or classical Punjabi, Persian and Brij.

1. Primary Sources & Literature

This section outlines the development of Sikh philosophy from Indic sources, the streams of exegetical literature, to the formation of ‘Sikh Philosophy’ as a field of modern knowledge linked to broader fields such as world philosophies, global philosophies of religion, and the more specialised field of Sikh studies. What remains relatively constant in the passage from premodern sources and their translations into modern Sikh philosophy is the axial concept gurmat, which connects past to present knowledge formations, and also provides a cohesiveness to Sikh thought and practice from the sixteenth century to the modern period. Despite its centrality to Sikh thought, however, recent interpretations of gurmat have tended to conflate the meaning and function of gurmat with ‘doctrine’ conceived in a broadly Christian theological sense. One scholar, for example, argues that the term gurmat connotes “the Gurus’ view or doctrine that is at the same time a living practice among Sikhs” (Pashaura Singh 2014: 225). Though seemingly innocuous, the conflation of gurmat with ‘doctrine’ is not only indicative of a shift from earlier renderings of gurmat, it also has implications for the range and function of Sikh philosophy. This point can be illustrated by tracking how gurmat was understood in the late nineteenth and early twentieth centuries, for example, in the work of philosopher-theologians such as Kahn Singh Nabha, whose authoritative work Gurśabad Ratnākar Mahānkōsh defines gurmat in various ways:

  • “satguru da siddhānt” - the right outcome of the satguru’s instruction;
  • “guru da thapiā dharam da niyam” – the established/foundational principle of the Guru’s teaching. (Nabha 1981: 418)

The key term in these explanations is satguru, which, in the broader context of Indian thought, simply refers to any preceptor capable to delivering higher spiritual instruction: utam updēsh dein valā achāryā (Nabha 1931: 146). In the context of Sikh thought, however, satguru refers more specifically to the authority of Guru Nanak himself. As Nabha states, satguru is “Sri Guru Nanak Dev” (Nabha 1931: 146) and further emphasises the function of satguru in relation to gurmat by highlighting the relationship between mind, self, and individuation:

gurmat(i):

  • satguru dī nassīhat - the counsel/instruction of the satguru
  • gurmat(i) mn nijh-ghar vasiā - the teaching through which mind/self comes to reside in its ground-state (true home) (Nabha 1981: 418)

Elsewhere, Kahn Singh Nabha traces the etymology of the two terms comprising gurmat, namely gur(u) and mat(i) (Nabha 1981: see p. 945 and p. 415).[2] The centrality of mind/self/individuation to the nature of gurmat is underscored in one of Nanak’s own compositions, the Siddh Gōst(i) (or “Dialogue With the Siddhas”), where he emphatically points to the source of his authority. In this dialogue, Nanak is being questioned by the Siddhas, the great spiritual adepts of the time. At one point in the conversation, the Siddhas pointedly ask Nanak about the source of his authority to teach: “Tell us, Nanak, who is your Guru, of whom are you the disciple?”. To which Nanak provides an equally pointed reply: “Śabad is Guru, that consciousness attuned to it is the disciple” (Siddh Gōst(i): SGGS. pp 938-46).

As articulated below, this principle of śabad-as-guru or simply śabad-guru is repeatedly stressed throughout the primary sources to the extent that it becomes synonymous with the meaning and end of gurmat itself. It is in this sense that the core of the discourse of gurmat – its siddhāntic nature - is the theory, practice, and technique of śabad as a tool for overcoming a debased self-nature and transitioning towards an elevated self. From this perspective, the nature of gurmat can be more usefully envisaged as a paradoxical anti-doctrinal doctrine[3], whose meaning incorporates, but is not limited to: the Guru’s instruction, the wisdom of the Guru, the Gurus’ system or logic; the Gurus’ philosophy of life as a whole; the teachings of the Guru. Only as an anti-doctrinal doctrine can gurmat be considered an ordering category that serves to both differentiate and connect Nanak’s system of thought-practice from other major systems extant at the time, including but not limited to the Hindu śāstras, Buddhism, Islamic thought (especially Sufism), Kashmir Śaivism, the system of Gorakhnath and Vaishnavism. As is evident from the literature, an inevitable implication of Nanak’s establishment of gurmat as theory-practice and his investing supreme authority in the principle of śabad-guru, is that it was contested particularly by groups and systems that regarded Veda as the supreme authority. As we see below, these contestations continued well into the modern period and are alive and well today.

1.1 Premodern Sources

1.1.1 Guru Granth Sahib

The principal source of inspiration for Sikh philosophers and theologians is the Guru Granth Sahib, or as it is commonly referred to by Sikhs, the Sri Guru Granth Sahib (SGGS). This is the body of Sikh scripture compiled and canonised by Nanak’s fifth successor, Guru Arjan, in 1604.[4] A large volume of 1431 pages whose various sections are aesthetically organised under musical measures (or raga), the SGGS includes compositions by Hindu and Muslim mystics, including Jaidev, Nāmdev, Kabir, and Sheikh Farid. The foundational nature of the SGGS for Sikh thought and practice is reflected in the appellations gurbanī (lit. utterance of the Guru) or dhur-ki-bāṇī. Often translated as ‘revealed’ dhur-ki-bāṇī can be more usefully rendered as utterances from the far-side, a reference to the widely held belief that these compositions are not mere literature or poetry but come from beyond the limit of human imaginary through deep spiritual experience.

1.1.2 Kabit and Swayyas of Bhai Gurdas

Although the absolute primacy of gurbanī is attested to by almost all contributing authors to the SGGS, the notion itself is canonised in the writings of Bhai Gurdas (1540-1630 AD), the scribe responsible for producing the first physical copy of the SGGS under the close guidance of Guru Arjan. Bhai Gurdas was a key member of the early Sikh community. His own poetic compositions include the Vārān, Kabits and Swayyas, which represent the first, and arguably, most authoritative commentary on the SGGS. Composed in lucid style, his main purpose was to interpret the key teachings of the house of Nanak for the early Sikh community. In addition to providing commentary, his compositions develop the first philosophical and theological expositions of Nanak’s key ideas, forging them into a loose but relatively systematic doctrinal interpretation of gurmat, which was essential for establishing the patterns of Sikh thought-practice. As a result, Bhai Gurdas’ works are regarded as a key or kunji for unlocking the deeper insights of the SGGS and is therefore treated as a primary literature for research in Sikh philosophy (Gill 2016; Grewal 2023: 61-72).

1.1.3 Janamsākhī

This is a narratological genre depicting the lives of Sikh Gurus, especially Nanak. The earliest janamsākhī texts can be dated to around 1658 and different cycles evolved into the mid-seventeenth century. As a genre it is more commonly associated with devotional piety than philosophical thought because of its hagiographical style. However, recent research on this genre shows that this view requires rectification as the janamsākhī weave in verses from gurbanī into their life-narratives, the aim being to harness emotion and affect to extract moral concepts of gurmat in order to contextualize them within human life (Grewal 2023: 68). In this way, janamsākhī also provide important clues about the motivational impulses behind Nanak’s engagement with the world and the nature of self-transformation that is central to his writings.

1.1.4 Dasam Granth

The Dasam Granth (DG - lit. the ‘Text of the Tenth Guru’) occupies an important, though not uncontested, place in Sikh literature. The DG is a composite text, important parts of which are the work of the tenth Sikh Guru, Gobind Singh. Much of the scholarly discourse around this particular text has tried to grapple with the question of ethical violence, warfare and social justice, which is a more explicit theme in the DG than the SGGS. The discourse, however, has been unhelpfully framed by the question as to whether there was a “change in the dominant philosophy of the Panth” from Nanak-1 to Nanak-10 (Guru Gobind Singh) given that the latter was overtly involved in warfare and the survival of the Sikh community. A more helpful way to see the relationship between the DG and SGGS, or between Nanak and Gobind Singh, is to view the DG as actualising what was potential in the SGGS. In other words, while the dominant philosophy of gurmat remained essentially unchanged, what did change were the actual circumstances on the ground, necessitating different, more pragmatic choices of action.

1.1.5 Udāsī and Nirmala Pṛnālis

Custodianship of philosophical exegesis and ecclesiastic affairs fell to Udāsī and Nirmala sects.[5] Because of their intellectual proximity to the orthodox Hindu Śāstras or schools of philosophy, these sects are also referred to as Śāstric prnalis (Taran Singh 1980: 93-118). The Udāsī school is associated with the sect of itinerant ascetics founded by Sri Chand, the elder of Nanak’s two sons. Although much of the discourse of this school is limited to oral exegesis, an early written record of this school of thought can be found in Sadhu Anandghan’s ṭīkā (exegetical commentary) on compositions by the Sikh Gurus. Most likely composed between 1795 and 1802, when Anandghan was receiving his training at Kashi (Varanasi), the center of Hindu orthodoxy, the tenor of these ṭīkās reflects a desire to integrate sikhī into the broader Hindu fold by implementing a reductive technique that frames Nanak’s teachings (gurmat) as a variant of sanātana dharma, a form of orthodox Hinduism that gravitates around a belief in ‘eternal law’ specified by the Veda. This sanātanist mode of reduction became a common feature of commentaries in the nineteenth century, carrying on into the work of the Nirmala school.

Unlike the itinerant Udāsīs, the Nirmala school not only produced a significant literature centred around philosophical commentaries on the central Sikh scriptures, but they also established centres of higher learning (akhāṛās) across North India. Nirmala scholars were by and large well-grounded in Indian philosophy, especially in Advaita Vedānta, which was deployed not only as a theoretical frame for their religio-philosophical discourses (goṣtī) and oral exegeses (viākhiā), but as a device for bringing Sikh concepts in line with classical Indian philosophy. Important Nirmala scholars include Pandit Gulab Singh whose main works include Mōkh Panth (1778 – ‘Path of Liberation’), which is a comparative study of gurmat concepts in relation to Yoga, Nyāya, Mīmāmsā and Vedānta. Another of his works is Bhāvarasamrit (1778 – ‘Nature of Immortality’), a treatise on detachment and the nature of reality. Arguably, the best-known Nirmala scholar of the early nineteenth century was Kavi Santokh Singh, best known for treatises such as Gurpartap Suraj and Guru Nanak Prakash (1823). He also composed the influential commentary Garbganjani Tīkā (A Commentary to Humble Pride), as a riposte to Anandghan’s earlier work. By the late nineteenth century, Nirmalā scholars were regularly producing works of an explicitly philosophical nature but with a more doctrinal bent. A good example is Pandit Tara Singh Narotam’s treatise Sri Gurmat Nirnai Sāgar (1877 – “A Treatise on the Nature of Gurmat”). Written at a time of heightened political tensions between Hindus, Muslims and Sikhs under British rule, the title Gurmat Nirnai Sāgar indicates efforts to reposition the term gurmat in philosophical and religious disputes between various Sikh schools of interpretation and even more so in helping to demarcate and solidify socio-political boundaries between Sikhs and Hindus. Narotam’s treatise was a major attempt to expand the fundamental concepts of the Sikh Gurus (gurmat), albeit from the traditional Indian non-dualistic standpoint.

1.1.6 Giānī Prnāli

The importance of the Giānī prnālī (also known as the Giani Sampardai) is that its authors and their scholarship not only imbibed premodern and modern influences, but equally complicated the premodern/modern distinction. The term giānī is a Punjabi derivation of the Sanskrit jñāna or jñāna mārg or path of high learning or deep wisdom. The Giānī prnālī originated with Bhāī Mani Singh and Babā Deep Singh, both of whom were under the tutelage of the tenth Sikh Guru, Gobind Singh, during his stay at Damdamā Sahib (Taran Singh 1996: 77). Mani Singh later founded a taksāl or centre of higher learning, where he developed the art of kathā – the delivery of oral discourses expounding the teachings of the Sikh Gurus based on close exegesis of a given śabad or verse from the Guru Granth Sahib. Kathā is now regarded as integral to the practice of gurmat and is specifically tied to the Giānī school. Baba Deep Singh remained at Damdamā, where he founded a similar taksāl. Both of these institutions gave rise to influential lineages of scriptural scholarship and oral discourse, which in turn were instrumental for disseminating the philosophical aspects of gurmat. A very particular form of their expertise consisted in combining philosophical explanations of the Guru Granth Sahib with biographical narratives (sākhīan) of the Sikh Gurus. Examples of scholarship that weave expertise in metaphysical philosophy with the art of storytelling can be found in works such as Sikhan dī Bhāgat Mālā and Giān Ratnāvalī (Bhāī Mani Singh), Prayai Guru Granth Sahib (Bhāī Chandā Singh), Sri Guru Granth Kōsh (Bhai Hazarā Singh), Gurbāṇī Vyākaran (Bhai Bhagvan Singh), Tawārikh Guru Khālsā and Giān Prabōdh (Giānī Giān Singh).

By the close of the nineteenth century, a notable shift is discernible in the scholarly output of the Giānī prnālī with the production of complete or partially complete commentaries on central Sikh texts. One reason for this was the contentious framings of Sikh thought by Christian missionaries and Indologists such as Ernest Trumpp, who published the first partial translation of the Adi Granth in 1877. Commissioned by the British administration, Trumpp’s translation was accompanied by a major preface which sketched Sikh philosophical and theological concepts in a manner that undermined the distinctness of the gurmat system (Trumpp 1877).

In an era of rising nationalist sentiment between the major communities of Punjab (Hindu, Muslim, Sikh) Trumpp’s ‘Sketch’ polarized readers and sparked a series of rebuttals of Western interpretations in the form of philosophical-theological commentaries. The first attempted rebuttal was the Farīdkōt Tīkā written by multiple authors belonging to different Sikh schools of interpretation, but under the overall charge of the Nirmala scholar Giānī Badan Singh. Although the Farīdkōt Tīkā project was undertaken as a response to Trumpp’s English translation and introduction to the teachings of the Sikh Gurus, it did not have the intended impact for several reasons (Mandair 2022: 31-33). First, the lateness of its publication in 1905 ensured that the Farīdkōt Tīkā was superseded and made irrelevant by the modernist literature of the Lahore Singh Sabhā. Second, its idiom emulated Braj literature, rendering it inaccessible to a wider Sikh readership. More importantly, however, it continued the trend within Nirmala schools of self-consciously framing the hermeneutics of the Farīdkōt Tīkā within the Hindu orthodox tradition of sanātana dharma whose Vedic-Brahmanical heritage of exegesis was governed by the theological paradigm of “eternal Sanskrit” (Deshpande 1993: 53-73). This appropriation of gurmat into the Vedic-Brahmanic paradigm was vigorously contested especially by modernist Sikh thinkers.

By the end of the nineteenth century, these contestations reached new levels of theological, philosophical and socio-political complexity, driven in part by the rise of a radically new interpretive paradigm based on the encounter between modern Western thought and existing schools of Sikh thought-practice. It is this peculiarly modern encounter which led to the emergence of the assemblage ‘Sikh Philosophy’. To understand how this happened, we need to look at the Singh Sabha prnālī, the school of interpretation which has dominated Sikh thought since the colonial period, ironically through its inadvertent alliance with religio-secular regimes of translation.

1.2 Modern Sources

1.2.1 Singh Sabha prnālī

Before it became a school of Sikh thought in its own right, the Singh Sabha started out as a social and religious reform movement with clear political undertones. Philosophically, its aim was to foreground the conceptual idiom of gurmat as a tool for resisting the more influential spheres of Christian, Hindu and Muslim intellectual thought. At the same time Singh Sabha thought needed to remain open to engagement with modern Western modes of critical reasoning and philosophical speculation. This approach is demonstrated in some of the early works composed by Singh Sabha intellectuals such as Kahn Singh Nabhā, Bhāī Vīr Singh and Teja Singh. In the 1890s, Kahn Singh Nabha published two important works, Gurmat Prabhakar (Gurmat as Enlightenment) and Gurmat Suddhakar (Essence of Gurmat), both of which listed key concepts of the Sikh Gurus arranged in alphabetical order and supported by a litany of scriptural quotations. In 1931, Nabha produced his monumental Gurshabad Ratnakar Mahānkōsh (Great Dictionary of the Guru’s Lexicon), which continues to be an indispensable work for research into Sikh philosophy and theology.

The late 1920s and 30s were fruitful decades for Sikh philosophical exegesis with the production of works such as Bhai Vir Singh’s seven volume Santhya Sri Guru Granth Sahib, and his Guru Nanak Chamaṭkār (Radiance of Guru Nanak); Teja Singh’s four volume Shabadarth Sri Guru Granth Sahib, Sahib Singh’s ten volume Sri Guru Granth Sahib Darpan, and Jodh Singh’s Gurmati Nirnai (Treatise on the Guru’s Philosophy). Almost all of these works are concerned primarily with establishing the doctrinal integrity of Sikh concepts rather than producing a systematic philosophy. In this sense, they mark a successful culmination of fifty years of interpretative activity in the idiom of modern Punjabi that effectively defined the nature of the early Singh Sabha prnālī.

The notable exception is Jodh Singh’s Gurmati Nirnai, which because of its succinctness (single volume as opposed to the multi-volume nature of other Singh Sabha works), its conceptual and schematic organization (other Singh Sabha works were straightforward textual exegeses) and its accessible style (it reads like a transcript of public lectures), can be regarded as the prototype for properly philosophical works on Sikh philosophy that would appear later in the twentieth century. One of the striking things about Gurmati Nirnai is its broad schematic arrangement which appears simply to have transplanted the Kantian ontotheological schema of God-World-Man for organizing the main chapters in the following way: (Chapter 1) God (akāl purakh), (Chapter 2) World (sristī rachnā), (Chapter 3) Man (manukh), (Chapter 4) the Guru (Guru)…… (Chapter 9) Word (śabad)… (Bhai Jodh Singh 1932). The first chapter is essentially an extended argument for the need to comprehend the existence of God in terms of a static immutable One. The crux of his argument is to demonstrate the transcendental nature of the One, which allows him not only to reproduce an intellectual separation between God/World/Man in the early chapters but, by the time he comes to discuss the nature of community in chapter 14, to use ontological separation as a basis for establishing an epistemological distinction between Sikh and non-Sikh world-views (Mandair 2022, 38). In many ways, Gurmat Nirnai was the bridge to the next generation of Sikh thinkers, particularly those writing in English, and more specifically those scholars who used its readily accessible schema to materialize a ‘Sikh Philosophy’ based on a modernized interpretation of gurmat. It was, in other words, the bridge that created the appearance of a faithful and unhindered passage of meaning akin to what Talal Asad calls a “secular translation” (Asad 2018) from gurmat to ‘Sikh Philosophy’, giving the impression that the two are exactly the same.

Arguably the first sustained and systematic work of modern Sikh philosophy is Sher Singh’s Philosophy of Sikhism (Sher Singh 1944). Sher Singh’s book is also the first to bring Sikh ideas into a comparative framework (Sher Singh 1944). Writing in the mid- to late 1930’s the author is acutely aware of breaking new ground as can be noted in his somewhat nervous attempt to justify the use of “philosophy” in the title of his book: “What justifies the title of my work is the angle, the viewpoint, from which I have approached Sikhism” (Sher Singh: i). This new perspective, he argues, is one based on “rational conviction” and “impassionate criticism” which alone can succeed “in exercising a rational check on biased opinions issuing from …. [t]he fact of my being a Sikh by birth” (Sher Singh: i). Equally noteworthy in this preface is Sher Singh’s apology for “indulging in comparisons between concepts held by the Guru and those held by some Western thinkers” (Sher Singh: i). “I realize” he goes on “that this was not very necessary and could be safely avoided. I have done so in the hope that such a comparison may render an Eastern concept more intelligible to the Western or non-Sikh reader” (Sher Singh: i, emphasis mine).

After the 1960s, there were sporadic attempts to rearticulate the discourse of Sikh philosophy. This can be seen in works such as Ishar Singh’s Philosophy of Guru Nanak (1978), Daljeet Singh’s The Sikh Ideology (1979) or Sohan Singh’s The Seeker’s Path.

1.2.2 New Wave

It is only in the 1980s and 1990s that a new wave of publications with an overtly philosophical orientation begin to emerge. English language works exemplifying this new approach include Avtar Singh’s Ethics of the Sikhs (1983), Gurnām Kaur’s Reason and Revelation (1990), Nirbhai Singh’s Philosophy of Sikhīsm (1990), Himat Singh’s Philosophical Conception of Śabad (1985), Jasbir Singh Ahluwalia’s Sovereignty of the Sikh Doctrine (1983/2005), and Nikky Guninder Kaur Singh’s Physics and Metaphysics of the Guru Granth Sahib (1987). Notable Punjabi language works focusing on Sikh thought include Harinder Singh Mahboob’s Sahaje Rachio Khālsā (1988) and Jasbir Singh Ahluwalia’s Sikh Falsafe dī Bhumikā (Preface to a Sikh Philosophy) and his Sikh Chintan: Darśanak ate Sansthāmik Vikās (Sikh Thought: Philosophical Vision and Systematic Development).[6] Also important here are the works of the Sikh postmodernist thinker and literary critic Gurbhagat Singh, notably his Vishwa Chintan ate Punjabi Sahit (World Thought and Punjabi Literature), Sikhīsm and Postmodern Thought and Western Poetics and Eastern Thought, the title of which playfully reverses the Indian philosopher Sarvapalli Radhakrishan’s classic text: Eastern Religions and Western Thought. Recent additions to this list include Sikh Philosophy: Exploring Gurmat Concepts in a Decolonizing Age (Mandair: 2022), and Guru Nanak’s Transcendent Aesthetics (2024) by Nikky Guninder Kaur Singh.

2. Metaphysics and Key Concepts

2.1 Oneness

Almost all commentaries on gurmat and modern works on Sikh thought tend to agree that the cornerstone of Sikh philosophy is a conceptual practice of oneness indicated by the symbol ੴ (ik oankār) which stands at the beginning of Sikh scripture, is repeatedly invoked in the canonical texts, and is treated as a mnemo-praxical sermon by all Sikhs.[7] The broad sense of ੴ (ik oankār) emerging from these commentaries can be summarized as: One (ik), whose fundamental resonant vibration (oan-kār) expresses itself in the same way in being and beings, sustaining the ongoing creative process; this resonant oneness thereby expresses the true nature of reality (satnām). Based on this definition it is possible to trace a metaphysics whose broad contours can be summarized in the statement that oneness is absolute - about which there is broad agreement amongst Sikh philosophers, although what they mean by absolute is described in different ways. For example, Nirbhai Singh uses the term ‘absolute’ to emphasize the “metaphysical necessity for Guru Nanak to develop a dynamic system which could restore the reality of action in historical time” (Nirbhai Singh: p. 65). Himat Singh deploys the term “Trans-Aesthetic” to shift discussion of the absolute nature of oneness towards the vibrational ontology of śabad (Himat Singh 1985: 21). Likewise Nikky Singh speaks of Guru Nanak’s transcendental aesthetic to depict a oneness that is simultaneously sensuous and non-sensuous, corporeal and incorporeal (Nikky Singh 2025).

Descriptive variations notwithstanding, contemporary Sikh philosophers seem to agree on the following implications of Nanak’s notion of oneness. First, that this oneness does not brook oppositions or dualisms such as one/many, matter/consciousness, form/formlessness, time/timelessness, conditioned/unconditioned, transcendence/immanence, corporeal/incorporeal, finite/infinite, dark/light, good/evil, to name but a few. Second, it follows that this oneness cannot be represented; to represent it is to enter into dualism. To comply with this imperative logic of non-oppositional oneness, Nanak resorts to the language of aesthetics.[8] Indeed, all of Nanak’s compositions and those of his successor Gurus are expressed in poetic form set to musical measures.

2.2 Time and Aesthetics

Aesthetics in Sikh philosophy therefore, has less to do with a theory of form or beauty than with sensibility, that is, the degree of sensitivity of an individual to experiencing subject and object, self and world, immediately and as a fundamental unity. For Sher Singh, this fundamental unity is a “feeling-state” which Guru Nanak describes as “vismād” or the “aesthetic feeling of wonder” experienced directly as an “enjoyment” of an “indescribable intensity” that can only be tasted (suād). Nikky Singh also emphasises taste as a central component to aesthetic in Sikh philosophy (Nikky Singh: 2025). For Himat Singh, this fundamental unity central to the aesthetic is encapsulated by the term śabad, which in its explanatory function acts a “trans-aesthetic” principle (Himat Singh: 1985: 203-22; 2025: 15-29). All three of these thinkers appear to agree, however, that aesthetics describes a sensibility in which “the experiencer and experienced is one linked unity” (Sher Singh: 238). It comes back to a oneness that is not quantifiable, but is qualitative, a state of being in which multiplicity is always already fused with oneness from the outset. This non-oppositional logic of the one-many (ek-anek) is the axial principle underpinning all existence and non-existence, all matter and consciousness, and therefore all life, in such a way that matter and consciousness are part of a continuum of oneness. Oneness incorporates both simultaneously. To say ‘simultaneously’ suggests a mode of time specific to non-oppositional logic required to experience oneness. It suggests that the difference between the one and the many is not only the same as its identity, but that coexistence of opposites, that is, coexistence of differences, is logically consistent only if we assume that the nature of time is not identical to itself. Which is to say that time cannot be reduced to the passage of identical moments, which, in Sikh philosophy, is ordinary or everyday, or time as it is constructed by the human mind – kāl (Nirbhai Singh 1990: 113-114; Mandair 2022: 57-59). Rather, the true nature of time is more complicated and more usefully considered as an internal proliferation of difference. Time is a constantly ongoing self-differentiation. According to gurmat, this infinitely expansive, measureless time, which is untimely in its essence, is referred to as akāl (Nirbhai Singh 113-114; Mandair 2022: 55-59, 136-37).

Modernist scholarship in Sikh studies has tended to translate akāl in theological terms as a divine attribute: immortality, eternity, immutability (see McLeod 1968: Ch. 5; Jodh Singh 1969). As argued elsewhere, theological interpretations by and large followed trends in Christian thought in reducing akāl (infinite, immeasurable, timeless time) to kāl (chronological, spatialized, human time). Akāl is therefore not an objectifiable mode of time, but an experiential awareness of oneness in which there is no oppositionality, no enmity, no distance between self and other, subject and object. From this perspective, reality is one and many at the same time, and can be ‘known’ only intuitively or affectively.

Two important questions arise here. First, if the true nature of reality is oneness, and if the nature of this oneness is infinitely expansive, unchanging, measureless, etc., why are we not aware of this oneness during the course of daily life? What prevents us from realising this in the world that we live in, or in the social contexts we inhabit? (Mandair 2022: 80)

2.3 Self and Individuation

The answer, according to Nanak, lies in the way that our ego has been structured and conditioned by society since birth, but especially since the acquisition of language.[9] This social-symbolic conditioning limits the function and potential of the ego by impelling it to separate itself from itself, through a mode of individuation that takes identity as the condition for difference. In other words, its sense of reality begins with self-affirmation (haumai: lit. I am myself) that fundamentally denies its own otherness. The functionality of haumai has been understood in various ways in recent works of Sikh philosophy. Nirbhai Singh interprets haumai negatively as the “evil of individuation” (Nirbhai Singh 1990: 158). In Gurnam Kaur’s treatment, haumai stems from the disease or a poison stemming ultimately from ignorance. However, Sher Singh reads haumai as the “cause of our personal individuality”, yet the individual self is no more than a “temporary partition caused by our individualism” (Sher Singh 1944: 227-229). As a “partitioning element” haumai may be a disease, an obstacle to the yearning within us to become one with nām, but at the same time, Sher Singh also highlights Nanak’s own refusal to denounce haumai as simply negative. For Nanak, the cure to haumai lies within haumai itself, suggesting that individuation is a more complex process in which self-making has be balanced with self-unmaking. A more helpful way to think about the mechanism of individuation proper to haumai is to regard it as a psychic entity that becomes stuck in a recursive feedback loop that generates self-sameness or identity shorn of difference. From within the limited kāl-centric time-frame that we inhabit, we are conditioned in such a way as to create a split within the field of consciousness by jettisoning what we deem to be not-self or other. This conventional form of individuation (manmukh = mind-facing individuality), which we believe constitutes normality, can interact with the world, with other selves, only via the split or oppositional binary. From here on, what the conventional self understands as oneness is actually a form of individuation based on a drive toward self-identity.

Thus far, Sikh philosophy’s analysis of the ego/self gives the impression of being not too far removed from the humanism that underpins Freudian, Lacanian, and Kleinian forms of Western psychology. Where it differs is in its relative attribution of value to ego and non-ego. In Western psychology, a strong and stable ego is valued, and through this valuation non-ego is devalued and effectively banished from waking-state consciousness that we regard as ‘reality’. In contradistinction, Sikh philosophy, as we read below, values the relation between ego and non-ego. Reality disappears when we separate ego and non-ego; it opens up when we relate them.

This brings us to the second question. How is oneness to be realised, brought into effect? (SGGS: Japji 1; Avtar Singh 1983) Here, Sikh philosophy departs even more radically from humanism. According to Sikh philosophy, the conventional ego needs to be radically transformed. Like other spiritual traditions gurmat talks about transforming the conventional self-conscious ego by annihilating it and replacing it with a different psychic structure. References to killing the ego are not merely metaphorical. They refer to the self-effort required to tap into a reservoir of force immanent within life, tapping which it becomes possible to transform conventional processes of ego formation (haumai), not by literally killing the ego, but by re-orienting the desire that makes it crave for the contracted egocentric state of consciousness, which society has conditioned us to desire in the first place (see McLeod 1968: Ch. 7; Nikky Singh 2005). This ordinary, socially conditioned state is called manmukh. Terms such as ‘annihilation’ or ‘killing’ thus refer to the self-overcoming required to break our attachment to convention. And this self-overcoming is required to shift the axis of desire toward the aspect of the psyche that society forced it to split off and ultimately repress, namely, the non-ego, the outside world, the other, or the infinitely expanded reality of oneness.

2.4 Śabad and Nām

In Sikh philosophy, the clearest indication of this psychic transformation of desire is registered through new and creative modes of aesthetic symbolization expressed variously through language and poetics, music, dance and thought. The agent of this transformation is śabad, which literally means ‘word’ or ‘language’, but, in the context of Sikh philosophy, refers to any and all kinds of resonant vibration (Himat Singh 1985). According to Himat Singh, vibration or resonance refers to the work done by śabad to enfold the experience in vitality and the expression-in-vitality”. In other words śabad provides an ontology of vibration that enables the self to simultaneously experience the “thing-in-action” and at the same time enables expressivity in, and connectivity to, the world, to other selves, beginning with a re-linking of the self to its own self (or individuation). For Himat Singh śabad is a “trans-aesthetic” tool par excellence which closes the split introduced by conventional social symbolization. Though rarely considered in this way, the idea of resonant vibration offers insight into the practical ends of Sikh thought, namely, the achievement of liberation in the stream of life (jivanmukti), which in fact is simply a way of saying that the event of ego transformation described above liberates the self not from the self, or from the world, but rather liberates it to make new and more creative connections to the world (Himat Singh 1985). The key point to remember here is that śabad exerts an impersonal, unmediated agency, one that does not arise from a humanly engendered mediation, but rather arises spontaneously when individuals follow the imperative (hukam) within all existence and all non-existence and in all life. The imperative (hukam) can be tapped when the self dies to the word, in other words, sacrifices itself to the word.

Such references to sacrifice, surrender, and dying are not mere metaphors. In fact, they have a practical counterpart in the performative meditative mnemo-praxis called nām simaran, a form of mindful practice that Sikhs are encouraged to imbibe into their daily lives. Although nām simaran is often literally translated as remembering or recalling nām by repeating the ‘Names of God’, there is a wider sense in which it refers to any process that helps transform the mind’s negative repetition-compulsions into a positive mode of repetition which enables it to actualise (or channel) nām within and through the body–mind complex. In Sikh philosophy, the favoured techniques of simaran include vocalised rhythmic repetition and especially singing to the accompaniment of prescribed musical measures (ragas). The term nām refers to the vibration that underpins the eternal oneness of all existence and non-existence. If this vibration-resonance is indicative of process or becoming exemplified by the opening of subjectivity to the world, the very same process is objectified by theology, which solidifies nām into the Name of an eminent deity, e.g. ‘God (Mandair 2022: 52-58). The meditative mnemo-praxis of nām simaran works against this objectifying tendency by symbolically performing a death of the self in the very act of recalling or remembering nām. Through this mindful technique, one simultaneously surrenders, annihilates, and converts haumai (or individuation as self-attachment) into individuation as other-attachment.

2.5 Self-Transformation

Ultimately, if the purpose of nām simaran is to open the self to the other, to the world, the process itself, as well as its effects, takes place not in some otherworldly, supernatural realm, but in the time of this world. However, the temporality of such transformations cannot be reduced to secular time, which would still be in some sense ‘transcendental’ (in the Kantian/Hegelian sense). Rather, this temporality is immanent within sequential time. It penetrates and pervades ordinary time (kāl) and the ordinary self. To access it, however, the everyday sense of time and self has to be broken. This breaking requires a real and symbolic performance which connects self-death at the very moment that the self is generated. This self-death spontaneously breaks attachment toward sequential time-consciousness (kāl) and opens the self into an expanded, measureless time-consciousness (akāl). The ideal here is to achieve a balance (sahaj) between killing and regenerating the self, between living and dying, and weave this balance into the fabric of the self. The self that emerges out of such transformation can no longer see itself as an objectifiable entity separated from other entities, selves, and worlds. As a form of individuation that liberates in the stream of one’s life (jivanmukti), it is simultaneously form and formless, ego and non-ego, self and other. A clue to its ontological status can be seen in terms such as anhad nād or anhad śabad – uncaused, unpulsed or sourceless vibration, which is a reference to pure relation.

The most evident mark of this relational-self is the change in its mode of expression. It expresses itself only through the form of affective activity: poetics, melody, rhythm, as well as thought that is not shorn of sensation, all of which seem to be the best ways of expressing the paradoxical nature of its state: the self is neither thing nor no-thing. Its state of existence is between thingness and no-thingness, namely pure resonance, pure vibration (anhad śabad, anhad nād), or more accurately, uncaused resonance, unpulsed resonance, spontaneous/effortless resonance. All these references to vibration or resonance are ways of describing the nature of the self as pure relation. The self is basically a focal point of resonant force or intensity that enables it to create new connections, intersections, and relations between all things in the world. As a point of resonance, it signifies a fundamental opening of the self to the outside, it’s others, to the world, such that the duality of self (here, near) and world (there/far) is merged into the all-pervasive and ever-constant resonance that is nām. Alternatively stated, nām signifies fundamental tone or vibration of reality, the resonance that connects everything that exists and expresses the true nature of reality. The implication is that it is possible to associate entities, selves, people, societies, cultures through their differences; though beings are many and varied, they are internally connected through nām and therefore participate in a fundamental identity or oneness. From this perspective, difference is not a mode of separation, but paradoxically, a mode of connection that derives its force or intensity from the impulse within creation itself.

3. Epistemology (giān)

4.1 Sources of giān: In the gurmat system, the function of epistemology is encompassed by the term giān, a Punjabi cognate of the Sanskrit term jñāna. Giān signifies not only the nature of knowledge, its direct or mediated attainment through intuition (anubhāva or anubhau prakash) and perception/reasoning respectively, but equally its modes of operation vis-à-vis practice/discipline, thought and faculties (Sher Singh 1944: 152). Between direct unmediated knowledge attained through intuition and referred to as tat giān (pure knowing), and mediated knowledge (partakh giān) gained through perception and intellect, there is no strict hierarchy or qualitative difference (Nirbhai Singh 1990: 169). Any distinction between them lies in the variable attunements towards the fundamental vibration of reality (nām) characterised by a state of absolute unity. While some individuals have innate focus (dhiān) finely tuned towards attaining gian directly, also referred to as giān dhiān[10] , the vast majority of individuals must learn to sharpen and perfect their faculties of sense perception and intellection (vichār) until perception/senses and the subject become one with the object of knowledge (giān vichār).[11] In this way, the epistemology of gurmat does not distinguish qualitatively between different sources (pramāṇas) of knowledge as does Indian philosophy. That said, Sikh philosophers unanimously agree that the principal source of valid knowledge – the one that innervates others – is śabad (Balbir Singh 1972: 27).

In gurmat philosophy, śabad possesses corporeal and incorporeal aspects. As corporeal, śabad (lit. word, sound, language = nād or dhun) serves as a tool for linguistic communication and provides mediated knowledge (Tatlay 1998: Vol. 2 13-16). Thus, the giān of a manifest object is acquired through written letters (akhar) or through sounds and speech (nād), which are brought together to constitute meaningful statements (kathani), which in turn transmit giān. The corporeal aspect of śabad or nād is formed and transmitted in pulsed or linear time (kāl) and provides knowledge that is known discursively and discerned through conventional forms of reasoning such as aql, siāṇap, sōch, vichār, khōj, bādi (Kaur 1990: 83-95).

However, the more important aspect of śabad is vested in its incorporeal or vibrational aspect. Through different techniques and stages of meditative practice śabad is internalized and transformed into its incorporeal aspect, referred to in gurbanī as anhad śabad or anhad nād. The qualifying term anhad refers to unpulsed word/sound/vibration that cannot be measured because its vibrational frequency goes beyond the limits of conventional linear time and rational comprehension (Tatlay 1998: 183). The transition from the corporeal, pulsed, limited (hadh) to incorporeal, unpulsed, unlimited (anhad) takes place through an internal event, a process which ruptures the boundaries or limits of the ego, also referred to as the killing of ego (haumai māraṇā) or simply ego-death.

The effects of this event are twofold without there being any opposition between them. On the one hand, the effects take place at the level of the psychic corresponding to the transformation of the mind from a manmukh state to the gurmukh state. To recall what was stated earlier, the manmukh state of mind is characterised by a fundamentally dualistic mode of individuation, resulting in an individual whose core thinking and actions are motivated by ego-preservation and the maintenance of conventional societal boundaries. By contrast, the gurmukh state of mind gives rise to a mode of individuation that has not only attained a level of equilibrium or harmony (sahaj) between ego-loss and ego-formation, resulting in a praxis of living that is fundamentally relational and spontaneously attuned to nām. The gurmukh state results in a mode of knowing-being best described as onto-epistemological, which takes place, on the other hand, in the realm of time and temporality. Indeed, the rupture of the ego shatters all measure of time, thereby opening up or expanding temporality into a measureless formless time known as akāl. Nominally, therefore, there are two modes of time: kāl and akāl, which can be accessed linguistically via śabad and anhad śabad, respectively, and correspond psychically to manmukh and gurmukh states.

Many of the philosophical commentaries composed in the twentieth century tended to treat concepts such as kāl/akāl, śabad/anhad śabad, manmukh/gurmukh as binaries, thereby introducing oppositions into what are essentially non-oppositional, co-imbricated categories. This tendency was exaggerated in English translations, which made it difficult for scholars to differentiate rigorously between theological-religious and philosophical idioms. For example, anhad sabad is frequently translated as ‘revealed word’, ‘ineffable Word’, or ‘sacred sound’, all of which create an ontotheological distinction between their status as worldly/non-āworldly. Far from signifying the other-worldly or supernatural, anhad śabad is more helpfully considered as an aesthetic category (corresponding to the vibrational mode) that facilitates heightening of the body’s sensorial apparatus, making it capable of perceiving an expanded experience of reality (Nikky Singh 2024; Mandair 2023). The work of anhad śabad is almost entirely sensorial, and becomes realized though the progressive synthesis of experience from raw perception, through concept-creation, moving eventually into affect. In this sense, anhad śabad has a referent to which it signifies: nām, which is the unpulsed vibration of reality (Himat Singh 1985).

Recalling that gurmat is equally praxical and conceptual, each of these modes of transformation (semiotically from pulsed to unpulsed word, psychically from manmukh to gurmukh, or temporally from kāl to akāl) corresponds to an understanding of giān as a processual unfolding from a mediated, objectifiable knowledge of things, propositions, concepts, to an immediate, direct knowledge in which one’s senses are fully attuned (surati) to the ontological ground state referred to as nām. Giān is therefore a steady process of sensory perfection which ends in a state of consciousness marked by relationality. In short, the epistemic process begins when the individual consciousness has shifted from a self-centric dualism to a non-oppositional relational being-in-the-world.

3.2 Gian – Modes of Operation

If giān is a process for perfecting knowledge rather than a faculty in itself, this raises the question as to how knowledge is actually synthesised during the development process. What are the components of giān as a system for synthesising the contents of knowledge? Scholars have discerned three different modes of operation encompassed by giān: (i) Praxis; (ii) Cognition/Perception; (iii) Thought. Strictly speaking, however, these processes are part of a single overall process.

3.2.1 Praxis

As a practice, giān is centred around processes that interiorize the contents of empirical cognition produced through encounters with the world around us. Some essential parameters of giān are elaborated in Nanak’s most important composition, the Japji, whose repetition constitutes a cornerstone of Sikh praxis (SGGS: p.1). A literal translation of Japji is “The Meditation” signifying a memorializing technique in which words enunciated externally are simultaneously interiorized into spontaneous or intuitive memory.

3.2.2 Cognition/Perception

According to Stanzas 6-7 of Japji, the contents of empirical cognition are initially collected by the sensory faculties before being synthesised by the interiorizing faculties that comprise the mind (or mn). In Japji, the interiorizing process is treated as three-fold, beginning with vēkhaṇā (visual perception), sunṇaṇā (lit. listening or auditory perception), and munaṇa (initial process of interiorizing the contents of sensory perception into contemplative thought or concepts), ending with dhyāna (meditative-intuitive state of embodied knowing) (Kaur 1990: 130-142).

3.2.3 Contemplative Thought (dhyān)

Mediating the ‘transition’ from cognition and perception (vekhaṇa/suṇananā) to interiorizing/minding (munnai) is vichār, which ordinarily means to think, to reflect, to ponder, to contemplate, to rationalise. According to Gurnam Kaur vichār is a mode of rationalisation with broad functionality starting with mundane reasoning (soch), hair-splitting forms of discursive reasoning (tark, bādi), leading to a deeper internal searching (khoji), and culminating in the attainment of practical wisdom (aql, siānap) (Kaur 1990: 103-112). These various modes of reasoning - sōch, bādi, tark, khoji, aql, siāṇap – are co-imbricated with vichār but remain at the level of manmukh individuality limited by ego, indicating that vichār itself represents a progressive continuum in which thought goes through degrees of refinement as one learns to discriminate and judge at increasingly deeper levels. The highest level of discriminative thinking and judgement happens when vichār becomes bibēk vichār or ‘awakened reasoning’[12] - a level of thought where the mind discerns things without falling back into corrupting dualisms (kubuddhi).[13] For the final stage in the synthesis of knowledge, Nanak uses the term dhyān, which can be described as meditative focus in which being and knowing enter into an intuitive unity. Elsewhere in his writings, Nanak likens dhyān to the ripening or flowering of knowledge.[14] The floral metaphor points to the higher awareness of the gurmukh state, where the process of psychic individuation flowers into a state of perfection.

In light of the above, it is more helpful to understand giān as an onto-epistemology rather than epistemology in the strict sense, which is oriented towards objectivity of knowledge (Himat Singh 1985: 3-9). Giān is a subjective process that mediates between individual consciousness and the world, ironically by rupturing the limits of the individual ego. The essential tool that enables this process is śabad. The question that arises here is how consciousness interacts with materiality? How does consciousness become contracted prior to undergoing expansion? Nanak directly attributes this role to three main faculties: matt(i) (practical wisdom), mn (mind/memory) and buddhī (intellect) (SGGS: Japji: Pauri 36-7).

3.4 Giān – Faculties

3.4.1 matt(i)

In Gursabad Ratnakar Mahan Kosh, Kahn Singh Nabha explicates the meaning of matt(i) as an operation of mind encompassing several overlapping functions. In the broadest sense matt(i) refers to a practice and logic encompassing four other essential faculties: mn, buddhī, chitt and ahamkār (Nabha 1931: 34, 944). Mn is the faculty for concept creation (sankalp) and making determinate choices (vikalap). The term buddhi refers to the faculty of reflection or thought. Chitt is a faculty of memory that synthesizes past/present/future. Ahamkār is individuation of the type where the self learns to distinguish between itself and other entities (Nabha 1981: 34). According to Nabha, matt(i) is identifiable with ahamkār, which involves the process of synthesising the other three into a unified function of individuation and self-making. Matt(i) in this sense is essentially linked to practice and the development of technique(s) for self-making by receiving and processing empirical knowledge of one’s milieu through the sense organs (giān indriān). By itself matt(i) is an unstable faculty that requires shaping through the filters of linguistic, social and cultural conventions which help channel sensory information into pure ego production (haumai / ahamkāra). This view finds support in the final section of Japji, where Nanak compares the function of mat(i) to an anvil (ahruṇ) for fashioning the self with the practical tools of wisdom (vedu hathiār) (SGGS: Japji: Pauri 38 8). The tool that actually sculpts the self is śabad which works by mediating the contact between consciousness and the external world in a way that avoids the extremes of detachment and attachment to the world.

3.4.2 Mn (Mind/Memory)

An ubiquitous term in the gurmat lexicon, mn refers to the totality of psychic experience before being split in the process of encountering the world. Mn is an ‘organ’ that generates duality even as it projects the appearance of unity via personalized self-imagery. Mn can be described as an evolute (jiu) of five gross elements (panj tatt) (Nirbhai Singh 1990). As such mn is a dynamic energy (shakti) with two opposing tendencies: dhatu and liv. The dhatu tendency attaches mind to materiality, whereas the liv tendency orients towards oneness. In practice mn fluctuates between these two tendencies giving rise to qualitatively different but overlapping forms of individuation: manmukh or ego-mind possessing a reflective dualizing consciousness, and gurmukh or non-egoic, non-oppositional consciousness (SGGS: M3 955).

Nānak depicts the dhatu aspect of mn in various ways: mn-chanchal lit. clever mind that calculates and discriminates for personal gain; mn-bhoola: forgetful or amnesiac mind; mn-ārshī mind like a mirror of the world; mn-mughad: dull, stupid mind; mn-maighal: wavering, unreliable mind; mn-khutar: handicapped mind; mn-pardesī: mind estranged from its home or mind in its everyday sense of a self that conforms to everyday conventions of which the most pervasive is socially sanctioned language use (manmukh speech or simply ego-speech) that generates self-centredness (haumai) (Tatlay 1998: Vol. 6 26-35). Ever restless, ego-mind is likened to a dull-witted elephant roaming aimlessly through the jungle, constantly seduced by the charms of various plants (representing the social world), always under pressure from death, never able to find its way home. It is afflicted by a chronic sickness the disease of self-attachment (I am myself – haumai), and poisons its relations to the world, to things and persons. This aspect of mind that plots, calculates, measures, manipulates, flares up in anger and wallows in negative emotion (Shackle and Mandair 2005: Sect. 4.3, 4.5). Ego-mind is described as a stranger to itself, always estranged from its true home or natural state. It asserts its existence on the basis of an individuation that fragments and fixes experience by positing an absolute correspondence between its belief in its oneness and its own-ness (its permanence as an I), which itself stems from self-attachment. This correspondence between I-ness and 1-ness, which reproduces itself as an identity, sets the self in opposition to all that is not itself, including, firstly, its own self-difference (I as not-I). Nānak likens this mode of self-relating to delusion (bharam) (Tatlay 1998: Vol.5 429-30). In short ego-mind is a superficial self that merely conforms to the pressures of socially sanctioned language and a conventional social imaginary.

A similar depiction of mn as an organ that splits reality into two can be found in the following verse by other contributors to gurbanī. For example, Kabir writes ēhu mn shaktī ēhu mn siu: this very mind, is both force (shaktī) and self-luminosity (siu); this very mind subsists in sensory forms (ehu mn panch tat kō jīu); attuned to cosmic unity, this very mind resides as no-mind (ēhu mn le jau unmn rahai)) (SGGS: Kabir 342). From this state of unity (where mn and un-mn are the same) this very mind can account for the three worlds (tau tinī lōk kī bātu kahai). In other words, the central attribute of mind or consciousness in its natural state, when it is at ‘home’ with itself, is unity. Echoing this view, Guru Amardas, the third ‘Nānak’, writes, in its natural state mind is self-enlightened or self-luminous, it exists between life and death (eha shaktī sivai ghar āvai, jivdia mari rahai:) (SGGS: Malar M3 1257). The key characteristic of mind as self-luminous, self-enlightened is also highlighted in the mūl mantar, where Nānak uses the word saibhang (self-enlightened/self-surveying/self-enjoying). It refers to a state in which mind is directly conscious of itself – hence self-luminous. It needs no mediation; it is not split from itself. Mind possesses itself absolutely and subsists in a state of absolute unity – a unity that is not mediated by an externalising agency such as ego which serves to merely reflect the light. This primordial state mind can be described as immediacy; it has a child-like tendency to merge into a state of oneness in which all anxieties are removed (gurprasādi ekō jānai cukai moh andesā) (SGGS: M3 1252).

Nanak contrasts the immediacy of this form of consciousness with a very different state of mind, which exists as a purely reflective consciousness, always through mediation of an external agent. This mind is like a bird that constantly flies from its ethereal home (pankhi akasi), is subject to delusions (māyā), exists in a state of doubt (bharam), and becomes unstable (dhaiā): mn mayā mn dhaiā mn pankhi akāsi (SGGS: M1 1330). In short this is a mind that constantly separates from itself, never possesses itself, never undergoes ‘self-enjoyment’ in its ground-state (ghar).

Elsewhere in the same texts, Guru Angad (the second ‘Nanak’) comments that to attain its primal state of immediacy, the mn must get its energy from within itself, not from outside. Mind, in other words, is self-enlightened; it shines from within and cannot derive its radiance from an external source. In further references, Nanak describes this non-reflective or pure mind as: mn bairagi (self-detached mind) or ghar vasai (resides in its own home); mn nirmal (pure, unsullied mind); mn churai …. mn piara kartar ……… mn tu jōt sarūp hai (celestial mind); or simply beloved mind (mn har) (Tatlay 1998: Vol. 6 29-36). For this state of mind, Nanak uses imagery overflowing with the emotional intensity of lovers separated from each other in time and place, pining for each other’s embrace. This aspect of the mind is referred to as a state in which lover and beloved, self and other, I and not-I are separated even as they touch and fuse together. Even in the lovers’ tightest embrace, they are forever separating – an allusion to the effect of time, so that one needs to constantly repeat the gesture of fusion-love over and over again to stave off the separating effect of time. Nanak’s term for this aspect of time is birhā – a state that is simultaneously painful and blissful, in which separation and union occur at the same time and are felt as the same (Tatlay 1998: Vol. 6 365-7). To speak of this paradoxical state, Nanak invokes the intensely painful longing of two lovers pining to be reunited. Though fused as one, yet even in this joined state, their union is tinged with the anticipation of imminent separation (SGGS: 1256). Unlike ego-mind, the mind in the state of birhā is described as an immediate and intense experience as opposed to the mediated, reflective and therefore hollow experience of ego-mind. As the references to lover/Beloved illustrate, the immediacy of this experience arises from being in direct touch with feelings experienced as unique each time (pain, pleasure, agony, joy, sadness, bliss). Feelings associated with the lovers’ embrace or separation are never experienced as the same again. Hence the intensity of pain and joy….. What is felt, or how the mind is affected, is a qualitative change that cannot be measured except through one’s aesthetic sensibility. This is why it can only be felt as an intensity but never quantitatively fixed and calculated, because the element in which it takes place is time and life itself. What is slipping away is life as/and time, the time of one’s life, which is my beloved life (mn jindaṛī) … As Farid states:

All try to describe birhā, but your state, o birhā, is sovereign!

O Farīd, that body in which birhā does not arise is barren and desolate. (SGGS: 1379)

3.4.3 Buddhī

If mn is the faculty that receives sensory-impressions and organises them into percepts and concepts, buddhī works through the interiorizing function (antahkaran) (Nabha 1931: 113, 948) to determine the nature of percepts and concepts, categorising them, and ultimately, welding them into concepts. The role of buddhī “is to bring about certainty and definitiveness in knowledge. Definitive apprehension might spur action. Thus it is buddhī which resolves to act and then guides the ensuing action” (Neki 1986 Vol. 1: 405). Thus, buddhī corresponds to the higher, non-reflective aspect of mn, which judges, discriminates and discerns contents presented to mn in the form of concepts (sankalap) which are then deployed by the self for practical purposes that might include, for example, carrying out an activity, or thinking in general. In this way, buddhi effectively determines the individual’s conceptual world view, the nature of a person’s thought, speech and actions. Responsible for the self’s day-to-day functioning, buddhi can develop different orientations. On the one hand, it can develop into ego-centric thought and action (hau-buddhi), leading to the manmukh state.[15] On the other hand, if it can become attuned to śabdic rhythms and nām vibration, buddhi can transform or evolve into enlightened self-awareness, also known as bibek buddhi.[16] To realise this transformation, however, buddhi has to struggle with the so-called five demons (panj dutt) which steal the individual’s mental well-being. Kabir further emphasises that buddhi undergoes a climactic transformation into a self-luminous mode of knowing-being (suddhi), which translates literally as perfection or becoming pure.[17] This transformation describes the process whereby the self returns to its ground-state, a natural and spontaneous psychic state called sahaj avasthā, where the unity of giān can be realised (Nirbhai Singh 1990: 186).

4. Ethics

For guidance on ethics and morals, Sikhs look to a variety of sources which fall into several different categories: scripture, hagiographical literature (janāmsakhi) and codes of conduct (rahit maryada). While scriptural teachings in texts such as the Guru Granth Sahib and the Dasam Granth tend towards a universal messaging and guidance, the janamsakhi and Rahit literature address a specific community and cultural framework. The Rahit literature, for example, provides basic life-rules, organisational duties or codes of conduct for how a Sikh ought to live. Its moral teaching can be traced to the sixteenth century writings of Bhai Gurdas, who provided the earliest interpretation of the Nanakian system, translating it into the very basic codes of living that helped guide and consolidate the early Sikh community (see Gill 2016; Darshan Singh 1986). The Rahit texts were reformulated into a formal document first published in 1954 called the Sikh Rahit Maryada (SRM or Sikh Code of Conduct).

Although the code outlined in the SRM continues to strongly influence the conduct of Sikhs, its limitations are becoming all too evident. The conceptual framing of the SRM belongs to the colonial period, where the preservation of religious identities took precedence over other considerations. This conceptual framing is proving to be increasingly inadequate for contemporary life in the major metropolises of India and in the Western diasporas where Punjabi tradition and lifestyle directly encounter post-secular politics, technology, environmental concerns and pluralism on a scale not seen before. To provide answers befitting the increasingly complex ethical dilemmas and social contexts from which they arise, Sikhs are beginning to bypass the SRM and engage directly with primary source literatures, especially the Guru Granth Sahib, in an effort to ascertain whether there is a ‘pluriversal’ touchstone for morals and morality.

Texts such as the Guru Granth Sahib, however, present a different kind of challenge with their lack of a rigid ideological framework and categorical imperatives. But this does not necessarily mean the absence of a system of moral thinking in the teachings of the Sikh Gurus (gurmat). According to the ethicist Avtar Singh, Nanak identifies a moral standard in relation to a self-realised person (sachiārā), someone who has struggled to remain faithful to the truth of an experience of oneness whose manifestation is egoloss, and to one who acts and lives in accordance with the sovereign imperative (hukam rajai chalana) that is ontologically before any social law (Avtar Singh 1983). The touchstone for morality is not grounded (contra the SRM) in a belief system or a standpoint. Rather, it is better understood as a general principle or sovereign imperative (hukam) which enjoins that whatever the duties or discipline entailed by one’s station (rajai/raza), these ought to be performed in such a way that in each act performed or duty fulfilled, one imbibe the sovereign imperative (hukam) inscribed into life itself, indeed into all existence (SGGS: 1). Because hukam is immanent within life (hukmai andar sab koe, bahar hukam na koe – SGGS: 1), it replaces the need for a transcendental ground, be that a deity or otherwise. In other words, because of the immanence of hukam, life is revalued for itself and not as a supplement to the divine. Life itself is sovereign and cannot be captured within metaphysical distinctions such as sacred versus profane, sacred versus secular and so on.

Inscribed into all life, hukam is the imperative to negate the ego, which says ‘I am’. If left untended, the sense of ‘I am’-ness becomes a disease engendered by the five propensities also referred to as the ‘five enemies’ or ‘five thieves’: (i) kām (concupiscence, lust or simply craving), (ii) krōdh (anger or wrath), (iii) lōbh (covetousness or the desire to possess what belongs to others), (iv) mōh (attachment or delusion) and (v) ahankār (egotistical pride) (Avtar Singh 1983: 53). These ‘five enemies’ are psychic propensities of the self that either attract the person towards something (for example, an object or an action) or repel the person away from what is wholesome. They are not biological or primitive urges or instincts but learned dispositions or habitual frames of mind that can take on a life of their own. If left unchecked, these propensities keep the individual in a state of restlessness (Jodh Singh 1932: 250-64).

However, as Guru Nanak reminds us in the first stanzas of his Japji, the ‘five enemies’ cannot be controlled through ascetic practices, ritual cleansing or by reflection alone. Rather, they must be regulated by inculcating and actively practising virtues such as wisdom (giān), truthfulness (sach), justice (niaon), temperance (sanjam), courage (niḍar), humility (garībī, nimarta) and contentment (santōkh) (Avtar Singh 1983: 53-7). Those who actively appropriate such virtues are able to inscribe hukam into their very being as egoloss. They actively resist saying ‘I am’ and instead balance this egotistical propensity by being able to say ‘I am not’, and thereby elevate themselves beyond the self-willed rationalist morality of societal norms (manmukh). Appropriating hukam (the sovereign imperative that resists being rationalised into a system of knowledge) forces the individual to think and act almost like an aesthete or artist. Such a person who is freed and empowered to challenge existing values, freed to create new values rather than blindly following social rules, is known as gurmukh.

Clearly, Guru Nanak’s moral standard of egoloss, the gurmukh, takes us beyond socially sanctioned oppositional norms such as good versus evil, wrong versus right and violence versus peace. It questions the very frameworks in which we operate, even as it allows us to make deliberate, conscious choices in both mundane challenges of everyday life and the more extraordinary quandaries that face human beings today. Consequently, the Gurus’ teachings are entirely practical and applicable to all life situations, actual or possible. They allow the person to determine how best to live from day to day in an ever-changing world.

Bibliography

Primary Sources:

  • Sri Guru Granth Sahib (SGGS), Amritsar: Shiromani Gurdwara Parbhandak Committee, standard edition.
  • Varan of Bhai Gurdas, Amritsar: Chattar Singh, Jeevan Singh Publishers, 1988 edition.
  • Kabit Svayyai of Bhai Gurdas, Amritsar: Singh Brothers, 2007 edition.

Note: On citing the Sri Guru Granth Sahib (SGGS):

The main body of the SGGS (pp. 14–1353) is a vast collection of around 6000 hymns of variable length. Their primary arrangement is by the raga or musical measure in which they are performed. Within the primary category of the thirty-one main ragas which are distinguished as separate headings, the hymns of the Gurus are next organized by their poetic form, beginning with the shortest, which may occupy only a few lines of text, and gradually progressing to much longer compositions, which may each take up several pages. It is within these formal categories that authorship is finally distinguished, beginning with the hymns of Guru Nanak, followed by those of the other Gurus in chronological order. Since all the Gurus used the same poetic signature ‘Nanak’, their compositions are distinguished by the codeword Mahala, abbreviated as M, so that the hymns of Guru Nanak himself are labelled as M1, those of the third Guru Amar Das as M3, and so on. Citation of hymns or verses normally refer to the page number (Ang lit. body=part), but can also include the raga and/or Mahala. For example, the following verse can be cited either by page number (p.260), or by giving the raga and Mahala as follows (Gauri Bavan Akhari M5 50.1, p. 260):

Hear, O mind, this truth I tell:
Seek refuge with the Lord,
Give up your tricks and cleverness
To be absorbed in Him.

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Other Internet Resources

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Arvind-Pal S. Mandair <amandair@umich.edu>

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