1. This seems to be implicit in the work of the first generation of modern Sikh philosophers who attempted to articulate the universal aspects of Sikh thought. The latter notion is reflected in the assumption held by contemporary Sikh thinkers that ‘Sikh philosophy’ can be equated with the intentions of Guru Nanak and his successors, which were codified as Gurbani (li. the utterances of the Guru). While this notion may have a certain appeal, it is also problematic for two reasons. First, it assumes that the category of ‘philosophy’ is trans-historical and trans-cultural. Second, it assumes that the categories of ‘gurmat’ and ‘philosophy’ are grounded on rationality and therefore basically equivalent and seamlessly translatable. This view is strongly opposed by many Sikh thinkers and practitioners who consider gurbani as dhur ki bani (loosely translatable as ‘revealed’) and irreducible to ‘philosophy’ which is a second order activity of mind. Accordingly, Sikh philosophy is also a second order activity reliant on gurbani as the primary inspiration for its thinking.

2. See Mahankosh (p. 945) where Kahn Singh Nabha traces the etymology of gurmat(i) as follows:

mat(i)

• āhamkār = forms of individuation (‘I-making)
• antahkaran = faculty for processing raw sensuous data of perception by interiorizing it
• mat(i) has four essential faculties – mn, buddhī, chit and āhamkār – but is identifiable with the fourth part āhamkār
• mn: faculty for concept creation (sankālap) and making determinate choices (vikālap)
• buddhī: faculty of reflection or thinking
• chit: faculty of memory (synthesizing of past/present/future)
• āhamkār: individuation of the type where the self learns to distinguish between itself and other things or entities
• mati is identifiable with the fourth faculty (āhamkār) insofar as āhamkār involves the process of synthesizing the other three into a single faculty of individuation or self-making

gur(u)

• the principle that is causative of effort/elevation/self-death
• from the root gṛh to swallow or take in
  • hence one who ingests a learner/devotee’s state of unenlightenment/ darkness, thereby enabling the devotee to directly realize the essential wisdom
• a spiritual preceptor with gravitas capable of divulging instruction
• preceptor of mat(i) capable of reaching the deepest part of the learner’s mind (thought/desires/speech formation)
• divine instructor of the gods (Bṛhaspatī/Devgurū)
• antahkaran or mn
  • the kind of individuation proper to a Guru

3. My use of the term ‘anti-doctrinal doctrine’ serves to complicate the facile rendering of the category of gurmat both as ‘doctrine’ and as equivalent to ‘Sikh philosophy’. Two points need to be noted here. First, neither gurmat nor ‘Sikh philosophy’ are reducible to doctrine as such, particularly if doctrine is conceived either in the theological or secular humanist sense. As argued in sections 2 and 3, the underpinning logic of gurmat is dynamic with a proclivity for adapting to different milieus rather than being a static once-and-for-all worldview. This dynamic and adaptive tendency of gurmat stems from the fact that it nature is siddhant(ic) which, in the Sikh context, refers to a logic, teaching or way of life that simultaneously encompasses the ability to experiment with practical techniques according to different milieus, and a conceptuality that combines different forms of reasoning with intuition . Thus, while it may be the case that at certain periods in certain periods and historical contexts gurmat gives the impression of ‘orthodoxy’, or ‘doctrine’ (see section-2 below), because the underpinning logic of gurmat is geared towards creative individuation deriving from the vibrational-rhythmic ontology of śabad/nām which in turn enables Sikh thinkers and practitioners to synthesize new and productive connections within changing contexts. From this perspective, and as outlined in section-3, the modern category ‘Sikh philosophy’ cannot be reduced to doctrine or to ideology because its core impulse derives from the vibrational ontology of śabad and nām rather than a static worldview.

4. All references to the Guru Granth Sahib will be cited as: Sri Guru Granth Sahib (SGGS), followed by the page number. This is based on the standard paginated text of 1431 pages.

5. The Udasi and Nirmala schools are recognized as important precursors of the emergence of modern Sikh philosophy. Overviews of the schools can be found in entries in The Encyclopedia of Sikhism on “Nirmala” by Shamsher Singh Ashok (1997) and on “Udasi” by Madanjit Kaur (1998).

6. Works on Sikh philosophy published in Punjabi language during the 1980s were written in the shadow of a Sikh militant insurgency against the Indian State, which had a chilling effect on explorations of internal pluralism. Sahaje Rachio Khalsa and Sikh Falsafe di Bhumika reflect this trend towards identitarian frameworks.

7. Variations of this basic understanding are reflected in commentaries such as: Kabbit and Svayyas of Bhai Gurdas; Teja Singh’s Shabadarth Sri Guru Granth (1932); Jodh Singh’s Gurmat Nirnai (1932); Bhai Vir Singh’s Santhya Sri Guru Granth Sahib Bhai; Sher Singh’s Sri Guru Granth Sahib Darpan. Philosophy of Sikhism Sher Singh 1944. And his Gurmat Darshan (1954);

8. Himat Singh also uses the expression “meta-Metaphysics” to describe an ‘immanent’ metaphysics grounded in aesthetics as the basis of thinking (Śabda Philosophy: 1985). More recently he has reinvoked the term “Trans-Aesthetic” which refers to the unity of experience and reasoning. Nikky Guninder Kaur Singh uses the term “Transcendent Aesthetics” to describe Guru Nanak’s metaphysics. Both scholars gesture towards the same idea, namely, the priority of aesthetics in Sikh philosophy.

9. SGGS. Rag Asa. M1. P. 466.

hau vich aya hau vich gaia

hau vich jamia hau vich mua

10. SGGS. M1. p. 223:

ek sabad ik bhikhia mangai

gianu dhianu jugati sachu jagai

11. SGGS. M1 p. 228

kirat paia ardh uradhi binu gian bichara

12. SGGS p. 1276. Malar M3:

acaru carai bibek buddhi pae purkhai purkhu miilai

13. SGGS. Ramkali. M1 p. 944.

kubuddhi mitai gur sabadu bicari

14. SGGS p.147:

Nanak guru santokh rukhu dharamu phulu phalu gian.

ras rasia haria sada pakai karam dhian.

15. SGGS Asa M. 3. p. 441: antari agian hau buddhi hai saci sabadi malu kholu,….

16. SGGS Malar M. 3. p. 1276: acaru carai bibek buddhi pai purkhai purukh milai.

17. SGGS Gauri Kabir p.339: kahe Kabir buddhi hari lai meri buddhi badali suddhi pai.