Supplement to Analysis
Modern Conceptions of Analysis, outside Analytic Philosophy
- 1. Introduction
- 2. German Idealism and Romanticism
- 3. Bernard Bolzano
- 4. Neo-Kantianism
- 5. Scientific Philosophy
- 6. British Empiricism and Idealism
- 7. American Pragmatism
- 8. Phenomenology
- 9. Indian Philosophy
- 10. Chinese Philosophy
- 11. Conclusion
1. Introduction
This supplement sketches some of the new conceptions of analysis and transformations of some of the old conceptions of analysis, as well as some of the developments in debates about analysis, outside modern analytic philosophy, that took place after Kant’s critical philosophy.
2. German Idealism and Romanticism
It is difficult to overstate the influence of Kant’s Critical system on German philosophy at the end of the eighteenth century and the beginning of the nineteenth. Yet, while many agreed that this system spelled the end of earlier dogmatic and empiricist philosophies, few accepted it wholesale. Many, for instance, rejected Kant’s notion of the thing-in-itself (often regarded as central to his system); and his method of deriving the categories of the understanding. From the early responses to the Critical philosophy, post-Kantian German Idealism and Romanticism were born. Among the key concerns of these movements were the relations between the theoretical and the practical, mind and nature, parts and wholes, and the finite and the infinite. In all these concerns, conceptions of analysis and synthesis played a significant role.
Johann Gottlieb Fichte
As mentioned in the main article, the method of Part II of Fichte’s Foundation to the Entire Wissenschaftslehre is analytic in the decompositional and connective senses because it is the reflective decomposition, into individual intellectual acts, of a synthetically unified whole, to which the individual acts are always related. Fichte also describes all judgements as involving the decomposition of a synthetically unified whole comprised of the self and the world outside the self, both of which are posited in accordance with certain laws of reason. He writes: “Through positing myself, I necessarily posit a world outside myself, and exactly as it appears to me; this lies in the necessary laws of reason. Now what is the ever-ongoing experience? It is the continued analysis of that which already lies, certain as I am, in what was first posited” (FGA, IV, 1, 358). Given that all judgements involve this decomposition, Fichte claims that they are, to this extent, analytic. Yet they are analytic not only in the decompositional sense but also in the connective sense, as the relation to the larger whole is always present.
(For discussion of Fichte’s philosophy, see the entry on Fichte.)
Karoline von Günderrode
The notion of the world being a synthetic unity that is subject to analysis in the decompositional and connective senses reaches a high point in an essay, entitled ‘The Idea of the Earth’, written by the romantic poet and philosopher, Karoline von Günderrode (1780–1806). Günderrode asserts that the earth is comprised of the elements of soul (essence, force) and body (extension, form). Certain syntheses of these elements, she argues, result in life. And individual life, such as a person, comes to an end when the synthetic unity of these elements is dissolved. Yet, Günderrode claims, the elements that remain after the decomposition of the synthetic unity of an individual life do not return to the state they were in before they entered into this unity. Being synthesised into a life alters elements, such that afterwards they will enter into ever more elevated unities of life {Quotation}. So long as the equilibrium of the earth’s elements is achievable, Günderrode contends that the life and death cycle of individuals will lead to the development of the earth as a “collective organism … where all body would also at the same time be thought, all thinking at the same time body, and a truly transfigured body, without lack or illness and immortal” (GSW, I, 448; IE, 83). While Günderrode does not use the term ‘analysis’ in her essay, it is possible nonetheless to attribute to her a thoroughly novel conception of the notion. Assuming the achievability of the equilibrium of the earth’s elements, all analysis, understood as decomposition, is, for Günderrode, a precursor to the most elevated synthesis of the earth’s elements, which will result in the organism she calls “the realized idea of the earth”, meaning that it also has a connective aspect (GSW, I, 449; IE, 84).
Johann Wolfgang von Goethe
To understand Goethe’s conception of analysis, it is helpful to view it against the backdrop of Kant’s account of the ideas of reason. Kant introduces the topic of the ideas of reason, in the Critique of Pure Reason, by way of a discussion of Plato’s notion of ideas, which Plato regarded, Kant writes, as “archetypes of things themselves” (CPR A313/B370). Ideas of reason, if they could be proven to be valid with respect to objects of possible experience for us, would be known as the original conditions of things. An idea of an animal, for instance, would be known as the original condition of the arrangement and development of the body of an animal one is made aware of through experience. If an analysis were to begin with the experienced animal, where this analysis is understood in the sense of a regression from the animal to its fundamental condition, it would end with the idea. Yet Kant denies the validity of the ideas of reason with respect to objects of possible experience for us and limits them to playing a merely regulative, as opposed to a constitutive, role in our cognitions.
Goethe challenges Kant on this point. He claims that analysis, understood in the regressive sense, when conducted properly, comes to an end with archetypal phenomena (Urphänomene), the conception of which is a modification of Kant’s conception of the ideas of reason. An analysis, as Goethe describes it, involves comprehensively presenting related phenomena “in a certain sequence so that we [can] determine the degree to which all might be governed by a general principle [i.e., archetypal phenomenon]”—hence it is in part connective (1829, 994). Goethe thinks that by conducting an analysis properly, we will have direct experience of an archetypal phenomenon, which we can then use to explain why the phenomena of our analysis appear as they do and why they are sequentially related in the manner they are (see GSS, 194–5).
An example will help here. Goethe claims that Isaac Newton’s account of colour in terms of the diverse refrangibility of light rays does not explain why the colours appear in the order they do within the spectrum Newton produced by refracting sunlight with a prism. Newton’s account states, for instance, that red and yellow are associated with rays of different degrees of refraction, and that because red is associated with rays that refract least, it precedes yellow, which is associated with rays that refract second to least, within this spectrum. But, Goethe contends, Newton’s account does not explain why the colours red and yellow are associated with the degrees of refraction they are associated with, and thus why the colour red precedes the colour yellow in the spectrum (as opposed to a lesser degree of refraction preceding a greater degree of refraction). To give his own account of colour, Goethe begins by showing that Newton’s spectrum is actually comprised of two edge spectra, each arising from a boundary of white and black being viewed through a prism. He then shows that the sequence of the colours in each edge spectrum exhibits the structure of white, followed by a light colour, followed by a dark colour, followed by black. This is Goethe’s analysis of colour, and the archetypal phenomenon he thinks is experienced by means of this analysis is a combination of the two boundaries of white and black, at which colours are ordered in their ‘natural’ sequence, as described in the previous sentence. Using this archetypal phenomenon, we can, according to Goethe, explain why red precedes yellow in Newton’s spectrum. It does so because at this end of Newton’s (full) spectrum there is a boundary of white and black, and the red in the edge spectrum at this boundary, being a darker colour than the yellow in the same spectrum, is conditioned by the archetypal phenomenon to appear closer to the black side of the boundary than the latter. The reason white does not appear in the middle of the two edge spectra that comprise Newton’s (full) spectrum, according to Goethe, is that it is replaced by the partial overlapping of the yellow and cyan at the light ends of these spectra.
Georg Wilhelm Friedrich Hegel
The cornerstone of Hegel’s system of philosophy is his Science of Logic, which, as he explains, explicates “the necessary forms of thinking, and its specific determinations” (SL, 21.34). The method of this logic, according to Hegel, is both analytic and synthetic. Yet these terms are not to be understood in their regressive and progressive senses, as articulated by, e.g., Kant (see the supplementary section on Kant). Indeed, Hegel calls into question the distinction between these two senses of the terms (see SL, 12.202). To grasp what Hegel means when he says that the method of his logic is both analytic and synthetic, it must first be noted that, according to Hegel, this method is constituted “by the determinations of the Concept [Begriff] and their connections” (ibid., 12.239). The Concept, which is the grand logical structure elaborated in Hegel’s logic, is comprised of the determinations of universality, particularity, and singularity. According to the story Hegel tells, through a process of self-differentiation (becoming the other of itself), the determination of universality gives rise to the determinations of particularity and singularity, which in turn determine universality as the determination it is. An analogy will help here. A genus (universal) is a determination that differentiates itself into species (particulars), which differentiate into individual instantiations (singulars). Species and their individual instantiations can thus be thought of as arising from the differentiation of the genus. Yet, were there no species or individual instantiations of these species, there would be no genus (the latter, after all, is just what differentiates into the former). Species and their individual instantiations can thus be thought of as determining the genus as the determination it is. The analytic method, for Hegel, is that according to which all determinations are found to be already contained in a universal (ibid., 12.202–203, 242). Adhering to the analytic method alone, one might, for instance, presume to find all individual humans, in all their details, already contained in the genus (universal) Homo. This would be to presume that no detail of any human is determined by, say, a relation to something in the environment that does not fall under the genus Homo. Because the method of Hegel’s logic is constituted by the determinations of the Concept, and because the determinations of particularity and singularity are found in universality (i.e., in its self-differentiation), its method is analytic. The synthetic method, for Hegel, is that according to which a determination is found to be determined through its difference to another (ibid., 12.209, 242). Because the determinations of particularity and singularity arise by means of the self-differentiation of the universal (its becoming the other of itself), the method of Hegel’s logic is thus also synthetic.
(For discussion of Hegel’s philosophy, see the entry on Hegel.)
3. Bernard Bolzano
Bernard Bolzano (1781–1848) has been called the grandfather of (European) analytic philosophy, although there is little evidence of direct influence on what are acknowledged as its main founders (Frege, Russell, Moore, Wittgenstein, Stebbing, Carnap). Born in the year that Kant’s first Critique was published and dying in the year that Frege was born, his life and work spans the gap between Kant’s critical philosophy and the emergence of modern analytic philosophy. Bolzano criticizes Kant’s decompositional conception of analysis and anticipates many of the ideas of analytic philosophy, not least, the idea of interpretive analysis.
Bolzano criticizes conceptual analysis, understood decompositionally, for only working in a narrow range of cases (see e.g. 1837, § 148). The paradigm examples involve concepts like that of a bachelor, defined as an unmarried man, or that of a human, defined as a rational animal. Decomposing the concept of a bachelor into the concepts of being unmarried and being a man (of marriageable age) ‘proves’ the truth (on the Leibnizian model) of ‘A bachelor is an unmarried man’, but most concepts have a far more complex structure than their linguistic expression might suggest. Take the concept of a houseboat, which ‘contains’ the concepts of a house and of a boat, and hence looks like it would fit the same model. But a houseboat lacks many of the typical properties both of a house and of a boat (in the way that a bachelor does not lack the typical properties of being a man and being unmarried). If we now consider the concept of a boathouse, which might seem to ‘contain’ the same two concepts, and only these, then we realize that its analysis must be very different. A boathouse is not both a house and a boat (to some extent), but a house in which boats are stored—or ‘live’ (as opposed to normal houses, in which people live). But making this clear involves other concepts, such as that of being stored. There are typically complex relations between the ‘components’ of a concept that decompositional analysis might be taken to yield, and these relations need to be spelled out themselves. One of Bolzano’s own examples is ‘Erdengeschöpf’, which he analyses as ‘A creature that lives on the earth’ (1837, § 56).
As to Bolzano’s own conceptions of analysis, these are not themselves easily decomposed. Most prominent is a conception of interpretive analysis, whereby a sentence that is used in a particular context is reformulated to make explicit the ‘proposition’ (‘Satz an sich’) expressed, by cashing out any indexicality and removing any vagueness, for example. Bolzano himself uses the term ‘Auslegung’—‘interpretation’—here. This has the result that the analysans and analysandum cannot be considered as having the same meaning, but Bolzano was happy to accept that implication (1837, §§ 137, 387, 542). Such interpretation also takes place in a more regimented language of his own design, at the basis of which is the sentence-form ‘A has b’, where ‘A’ represents the subject (or subject-idea) and ‘b’ a property. If A is complex, then it is to be analysed as ‘Something which has a, has b’ (1837, §§ 58–9). Developing his regimented language, Bolzano was able to analyse not only existential and general statements but also statements involving multiple quantification (see Lapointe 2011, ch. 4).
Bolzano also makes use of a method of variation, which considers how the truth-value of a proposition varies when a constituent is substituted by another (of the same category). It is employed in uncovering the form of a proposition by generating a class of propositions invariant under a certain set of substitutions, and is also used in analysing validity, analyticity, derivability, and other semantic notions. Lapointe (2002) has described this as substitutional analysis and proposed that it be seen as a mode of analysis alongside decompositional, regressive, and interpretive (or transformative) analysis. But ‘substitutional analysis’ is better seen as a more concrete form of analysis that exhibits all three of the modes of analysis distinguished here (taken from an earlier version of this entry on analysis). In helping determine the ‘form’ of a proposition, it contributes to the task of ‘decomposing’—or better, ‘resolving’—a proposition into its constituents in their relevant structure (and hence as also exhibiting connective analysis). If we see this form as more fundamental, then we also have regressive analysis (see the discussion of this in §4 of the main document). And in generating one proposition from another, we also have ‘transformative’ analysis. (There is an analogy here with chemical analysis, where the elements and structure of a substance are determined by exploring its transformations in chemical reactions.) As mentioned in §1 of the main document, the three modes here—as well as connective analysis, made explicit in this revised entry—should be seen as aspects of analytic projects; and all of these are certainly aspects of the method of variation and of Bolzano’s analytic project, more generally. (See Beaney 2002 for a fuller response to Lapointe’s criticisms.)
(For discussion of Bolzano’s philosophy, see the entry on Bernard Bolzano.)
4. Neo-Kantianism
Neo-Kantianism, which represented a turn away from the scientific positivism and materialism of the nineteenth century, flourished in Germany roughly between the 1850s and the First World War. It was developed by two groups, the Marburg School and the Southwest or Baden School. These schools called for a return to Kant, but not by way of a wholesale adoption of Kant’s Critical system. Instead, the Neo-Kantians sought to correct and build on Kant’s philosophy. While there are significant differences between the Marburg School and the Southwest School—and indeed between the philosophers in these schools—there are also many commonalities, the most important of which for our purposes is the commitment to the Kantian ‘critical’ or ‘transcendental’ method. For, while the understanding of this method differs from school to school and from philosopher to philosopher, in each case it serves to exemplify conceptions of analysis identified in this entry. The three cases below each exemplify a combination of the regressive and connective conceptions.
Paul Natorp and the Marburg School
Paul Natorp (1854–1924) is one of the most influential figureheads, along with Hermann Cohen (1842–1918) and Ernst Cassirer (1847–1945), of the Marburg School of Neo-Kantianism. In a 1912 text, ‘Kant and the Marburg School’, based on a lecture he delivered to the Kant Society of Halle, he presents one of the clearest descriptions of the relationship of the Marburg school to Kant’s philosophy. Following Cohen, he claims that the key component of Kant’s philosophy, and “the steadfast leading idea of our entire philosophizing” (1912, 181), is the transcendental method. Outside of this method, however, Natorp argues that Kant’s philosophy requires many “necessary corrections” (ibid.). Chief among these corrections for our purposes here is the rejection of the view of Kant’s philosophy “as a codex of laws that fell from the sky” (ibid.). Natorp, along with the other Marburgians, rejects the claim that Kant’s system provided a collection of culturally and historically independent principles or laws that structure the facts of the objective world. Instead, Natorp and the other Marburgians regard the facts of the objective world as structured by culturally determined laws, and they take it to be the goal of the transcendental method to identify and verify these laws.
Natorp describes the transcendental method as involving two essential parts. The first is the assemblage of “current, historically verifiable facts of science, morals, art and religion” (1912, 182). This part of the transcendental method involves gathering together what are by current standards confirmed as the facts of a sphere of culture, e.g., natural science. These facts are assumed to be accordant—the laws of astronomy, for instance, are assumed to accord, in natural science, with the laws of mechanics. They are also assumed to be generated or constructed by culture, and because culture changes over time they are taken not as static but as dynamic. In Natorp’s words, a fact is ‘fieri’ (becoming) (ibid., 184). The foundation of the generative acts that produce facts is what Natorp calls ‘law’, ‘logos’, ‘ratio’, or ‘reason’ (ibid., 182). The law’s unity across an array of generative acts, however, is not always readily observable. Hence the second part of the transcendental method: showing the unity of the law in all generative acts that result in the facts of a sphere of culture. What this amounts to is tracing all facts of a sphere of culture back to their condition of possibility—a culturally determined unified law, or unity of reason—which, according to Natorp, is equal to displaying their ‘warrant’ (ibid., 182). This condition of possibility, this law, is also always fieri. The transcendental method, writes Natorp, “cannot locate the law of objective formation [i.e., the law in all generative acts] anywhere else but in that objective formation itself, in the creation of human cultural life that is always at work and never concluded” (ibid.).
Natorp’s transcendental method exemplifies (1) the regressive conception of analysis in the tracing of facts back to their conditions of possibility, and (2) the connective conception of analysis in the showing of the foundation of the facts of a sphere of culture to be a common law.
(For discussion of Natorp’s philosophy, see the entry on Paul Natorp.)
Wilhelm Windelband and the Southwest School
Wilhelm Windelband (1848–1915), along with his student Heinrich Rickert (1863–1936), founded the Southwest or Baden School of Neo-Kantianism. In his 1883 essay, ‘Critical or Genetic Method?’, Windelband gives an explicit account of what he takes to be the method appropriate to philosophy, namely, the critical method. He claims the provenance of this method to be Kant’s Critique of Pure Reason, while lamenting that due to certain obscurities in Kant’s writing, this method, which promises an alternative to psychologism, is not, in that text, “protected with self-evident clarity against every misunderstanding” (271). Unlike the Marburgian transcendental method, Windelband’s critical method is not intended to secure the validity of certain facts by reference to a culturally determined law but, instead, the validity of axioms or norms of thinking, acting, and feeling by reference to universal values.
Windelband begins his essay by stating that all human knowledge consists in “intertwining” (verflechten) particulars (e.g., sensations) and universal propositions or axioms that explain the connections and relations among the particulars (e.g., the law of causality). Thus, Windelband asserts that all cognition in the individual sciences “is based on the recognition of axioms” (1883, 274). Because of this, the individual sciences can only presuppose, and not secure, the validity [Geltung] of their axioms. The task of securing their validity falls to philosophy. There are two possible ways of fulfilling this task, according to Windelband. The first is to show the ‘factual validity’ of axioms (275), that is, to show that in actual cases of human thinking, acting, and feeling, the axioms have been accepted as valid. This would be to adhere to the genetic method. Windelband explains that this method, however, is doomed to failure for two reasons (276–7). First, it relies on psychology and cultural history, which, as individual sciences, presuppose axioms. It is therefore question-begging. Second, the most it could hope to achieve is to show that certain axioms have been taken by certain individuals as valid at certain times. Hence, relativism is its consequence, and it can in no way secure the universal validity of axioms. The second possible way of securing the validity of axioms, and the one Windelband endorses, is showing that axioms have ‘teleological necessity’, i.e., showing that they, and only they, must be accepted as universally valid “if certain ends are to be achieved” (275). Adhering to the critical method thus involves seeing axioms as norms. It also involves making one presupposition that Windelband claims is unavoidable for anyone undertaking a philosophical investigation, namely, that there is a ‘normal consciousness’ the axioms of which ought to be accepted in the pursuit of the universal values of “truth in thought, the goodness in willing and acting, [and] the beauty in feeling” (280). By the critical method, as Windelband envisions it, an axiom’s validity is secured if it can be shown that it must be accepted if one of these values is to be reached. Windelband gives two examples of axioms that can be shown to be valid in relation to the value of truth in thought: the axiom of non-contradiction and the axiom of sufficient reason (282).
Windelband’s critical method exemplifies the regressive conception of analysis as part of a progressive–regressive movement from axioms to values back to axioms. It requires that one confirm that the acceptance of axioms leads to the achievement of a value, by moving from axioms to value, and then that the acceptance of only those axioms leads to the achievement of the value, by moving from value back to axioms. It also exemplifies the connective conception in showing different axioms to be teleologically necessary for the achievement of a value.
(For discussion of Windelband’s philosophy, see the entry on Wilhelm Windelband.)
Ernst Cassirer and The Philosophy of Symbolic Forms
Ernst Cassirer (1874–1945) studied under Cohen at Marburg from 1896 to 1899. While he is associated with the Marburg School, however, he departs from its central tenets in many ways, especially in his later writings on the philosophy of symbolic forms. Instead of taking the goal of a critical philosophy to be tracing facts of science back to their conditions of possibility, Cassirer takes it to be displaying the principles that constitute the sensory as “the carrier of meaning” in all areas of “cultural consciousness” or ways of representing the world. For, as he explains, “it is precisely the totality of these principles which constitutes the objective unity and totality of mind”. (1927, 257)
To understand Cassirer’s philosophy of symbolic forms, it is helpful to refer to a case study he employs (1927, 256–7). Consider the perceptual experience of a line drawing. One way of regarding this drawing is as an aesthetic image, as an artistic ornament that connects meaning and significance, or as an expression that is part of an artistic language of a certain historical epoch. Another way is as a carrier of mythic or religious meaning, such that with respect to it there is no distinction between form and matter because it is imbued with a certain power or force. Yet another way of regarding the drawing is as a graphic representation of a mathematical function, e.g., a trigonometric sine function, or a physical law, e.g., the law of periodic oscillation. What all ways of regarding the line drawing have in common, according to Cassirer, is that they are constituted by systems of symbolic forms—e.g., a nexus of artistic meanings, an artistic language, a mythology or religion, a logical conceptual structure, etc.
Cassirer identifies three functions of thought, with distinct principles, that give rise to the different ways of representing the world. The first is the expressive function, saturating the sensory with immediate meaning or value. This function, according to Cassirer, results in the areas of the aesthetic and the mythic/religious and is to be recognized in all natural languages (1927, 258). The second function is the representative, resulting in language that purports to represent objective states of affairs by representing re-identifiable substances accessible to every thinking subject (the sentential copula ‘is’ is the most obvious mark of this dimension of language, according to Cassirer) and indicating these substances’ changing spatiotemporal locations relative to thinking subjects (through indicative particles) (ibid., 258–9). The third function is the significative, achieving a complete abstraction from the sensible. It results in a sphere of ‘pure signification’ or coordination of mere signs, e.g., mathematics and mathematical physics (ibid., 258).
The method of Cassirer’s critical philosophy of symbolic forms exemplifies the regressive conception of analysis in the displaying of (1) the different ways of regarding the sensory as constituted by systems of symbolic forms, and (2) the different ways of representing the world as produced by the expressive, representative, and significative functions of thought. It also exemplifies the connective conception in showing (1) the views of different sensory experiences as constituted by the same system of symbolic forms, and (2) the ways in which the expressive, representative, and significative functions of thought and their principles relate in the ‘totality of mind’.
(For discussion of Cassirer’s philosophy, see the entry on Ernst Cassirer. For further discussion of Neo-Kantianism, more generally, see the entry on Neo-Kantianism.)
5. Scientific Philosophy
Ernst Mach (1838–1916) was an important intellectual figure of the nineteenth and twentieth centuries. He did significant work in philosophy, physics, and physiology. Einstein credited him with having laid some of the foundations of his General Theory of Relativity, for example. Mach also had a major influence on the Vienna Circle, which in fact developed from the Verein Ernst Mach founded in 1928, and he is often considered a founder of Gestalt theory in psychology.
One of Mach’s most significant contributions to philosophy and psychology is his account of the physiology of the senses. He challenges the claim that the senses afford us knowledge of an independent world. In particular, he rejects the picture of a correspondence between our sensations and the states of affairs assumed, through interaction, to effect them. For Mach, all we know, and all that constitutes the world, are sensations. “Bodies do not produce sensations”, writes Mach, “but complexes of sensations … form bodies” (1890, 65). To be more exact, we arrive at the notions of bodies and their properties by analysing or ‘disintegrating’ complexes of sensations into their constituent parts (cf. ibid., 51). The complexes of sensations are neither stable nor permanent, but certain of their parts stand out as “relatively more permanent” than others (ibid., 49). For instance, I am currently presented with a complex of sensations that I analyse into the relatively permanent parts of form, colour, and density, and the relatively changeable parts of weight and temperature. The former parts form for me that which I designate the body that is my coffee cup. It is important to understand that on Mach’s model, when we analyse complexes of sensations into their constituent parts, we do not do so by recognising already delineated sensations of a discontinuous manifold. Instead, we do so by noting differential relations within a largely continuous manifold. This further supports the claim that we do not have knowledge of a world independent of our senses. For it means that all we know are relations between sensations.
(For discussion of Mach’s philosophy, see the entry on Ernst Mach.)
6. British Empiricism and Idealism
There were two dominant philosophical traditions in Britain in the nineteenth century: British empiricism, of which John Stuart Mill (1806–73) was the leading figure, in the middle of the nineteenth century, and British idealism, of which F. H. Bradley was the leading figure, in the last two decades of the nineteenth century, continuing to have an influence until the 1920s.
John Stuart Mill
Mill was strongly influenced by Jeremy Bentham (1748–1832), and Bentham’s method of analysis—which Mill’s father, James Mill (1773–1836), endorsed—was of particular importance. As Mill wrote in discussing this, “It is the introduction into the philosophy of human conduct, of this method of detail – of this practice of never reasoning about wholes until they have been resolved into their parts, nor about abstractions until they have been translated into realities – that constitutes the originality of Bentham in philosophy, and makes him the great reformer of the moral and political branch of it” (CW, X, 86). This method resulted in Bentham’s rejection of any ‘vague generality’ that could not be analysed in this way, and Mill came to be critical of this on the ground that such generalities “contained the whole unanalysed experience of the human race” (CW, X, 90). On Mill’s view, there were aesthetic and ethical ‘wholes’ that could not be reduced to their (material or bodily) parts.
Mill distinguished between two kinds of analysis: analysis into real or integrant parts that compose the relevant whole and analysis into ‘metaphysical’ parts that generate the relevant whole (CW, IX, 259). The model for the former was conceptual analysis, understood decompositionally, whereby a complex concept (such as that of a human) was seen as a logical sum of its constituent concepts (such as those of being rational and an animal). The model for the latter was causal analysis, where an effect is not composed of its causes but results from them. On the associationist view that Bentham and James Mill held, complex ideas were formed by a process of association, understood as a process that elided the two models, but this elision Mill criticized in the case of psychological phenomena. Mental states do indeed combine to produce new mental states but in such a way as to give rise to emergent qualities not possessed by any of the causal antecedents, just as chemical processes generate substances with entirely new properties.
On Mill’s account, psychological analysis involves bringing to conscious attention the genetic antecedents of a mental phenomenon, antecedents which are only present dispositionally: it is these that he calls ‘metaphysical’ rather than ‘real’ parts. Psychological analysis must thus proceed empirically, by investigating causes, rather than a priori, by conceptual decomposition. (For further discussion, see Wilson 1990; 1998.)
F. H. Bradley
Bradley’s most extended discussion of analysis occurs in The Principles of Logic, first published in 1883, with a revised second edition appearing in 1922. Book III (in the second volume) is concerned with inference, and in chapter IV of Part I he identifies two general operations in inference: synthetical construction and analytic elimination. In explaining the latter he writes:
The essence of analysis consists in the division of a given totality, and in the predication of either the whole or part of the discrete result. In the latter case the presence of Elision is manifest, but even in the former it is to be recognized. When reality first appears as a whole and then as a number of divided units, something certainly is gained but something else is eliminated. For the aspect of continuity or unity is left out; and thus mere analysis always involves and must involve some elision. (PL, vol. 2, 451–2)
Chapter VI is entitled ‘The Final Essence of Reasoning’ and focuses on analysis and synthesis, which he argues are actually one and the same, being two sides of a single operation: “Analysis is the synthesis of the whole which it divides, and synthesis the analysis of the whole which it constructs” (ibid., 471). Analysis, on Bradley’s view, begins with a datum, which presupposes a synthesis on which analysis gets to work, while synthesis, in constructing something by combining elements, thereby reveals those elements in doing so. “Thus in analysis we operate upon an explicit whole, and proceed to its invisible inside. In synthesis we begin with an organic element, or elements, not seen to be such; and passing beyond each to what is outside, so bring out the invisible totality which comprehends them.” (Ibid.) Both analysis and synthesis make explicit the elements that compose a whole, exhibiting both plurality in unity and unity in plurality as well as difference with identity and identity with difference (ibid., 472–3).
Bradley then seeks to show how this single process of analysis and synthesis can never be completed, since anything is what it is only in relation to other things. So we can neither identify elements (in analysis) that are independent of one another nor combine them (in synthesis) into a whole that cannot be further analysed by combining it with more elements into a larger whole (ibid., 486–8). Properly thought through, then, this single drive to analyse and synthesize inevitably leads us to recognition of an absolute reality, on Bradley’s view, in which all elements and relations are dissolved (ibid., 489–92).
Bradley clearly understands analysis decompositionally but emphasizes the complementarity of analysis and synthesis, here expressed in the stronger claim that they are one and the same, which implies that he also regards analysis as a connective process. Decomposing something into its elements (properly pursued) is at the same time to recognize their connections—and ultimately, how they are all connected into the one whole that is Absolute Reality.
(For discussion of Bradley’s philosophy, see the entry on Francis Herbert Bradley.)
7. American Pragmatism
The 1870s saw the birth of American pragmatism, which was first developed by Charles Sanders Peirce (1839–1914) and William James (1842–1910) and has remained highly influential. Another focus in Peirce’s writings is the theory of signs and symbols, which he called Semiotic. The study of signs and symbols was later taken up anew by Susanne Katherina Langer (1895–1985), who used these notions to develop a novel account of meaning.
Charles Sanders Peirce
In his 1878 essay, ‘How to Make Our Ideas Clear’, Peirce distinguishes three grades of clearness of ideas and the respective methods for attaining these three grades of clearness. The first grade of clearness is acquaintance, which is attained by becoming familiar with an idea, such that, in normal circumstances, one does not mistake it for another (EP, 1, 124–5). An example here might be a child’s apprehension of the idea of a bus. The child may not know how a bus works or what the definition of a bus is, but nonetheless be able to distinguish buses from cars, bicycles, and other vehicles. The second grade of clearness is clearness of content or distinctness, which is attained by giving a precise definition, in abstract terms, of the idea (EP, 1, 125). In a letter to William James from 26 February 1909, Peirce equates the method for attaining this grade of clearness with logical analysis, i.e., the decomposition of an idea into the terms that compose its meaning (EP, 2, 497). The third grade of clearness is the apprehension of the sensible effects of the object of the idea, which is attained by considering what effects, with experiential significance, the object of the idea has (EP, 1, 132). In the same letter to James mentioned in the previous sentence, Peirce equates the method for attaining this grade of clearness with ‘Pragmatistic Analysis’ (EP, 2, 497). He gives an example of a pragmatistic analysis of the idea of hardness, the object of which is a quality. This analysis, he explains, leads us to a conception of a quality the perceivable effect of which is that any object of which it is a quality will not be scratched by many others. “The whole conception of this quality”, writes Peirce, “as of every other, lies in its conceived effects. There is absolutely no difference between a hard and a soft thing so long as they are not brought to the test” (EP, 1, 132). The third grade of clearness of an idea is thus the apprehension of a set of experienceable effects that can be expected when the object of the idea is subjected to certain conditions or tests. The analysis that results in this grade of clearness is perhaps best thought of as a type of connective analysis, as it connects the idea and its object not only with a range of sensible effects but with an experiential realm of other objects.
(For discussion of Peirce’s philosophy, see the entry on Charles Sanders Peirce.)
William James
Between November 1906 and January 1907, James delivered a series of lectures at the Lowell Institute in Boston and Columbia University in New York in which he elaborated his pragmatism. In the second lecture of the series, he articulates ‘the pragmatic method’ (2014, 45) by building on Peirce’s account of pragmatistic analysis. This method, James states, “is primarily a method of settling metaphysical disputes that might otherwise be interminable” (2014, 45). One follows the method by bringing out the “practical cash-value” (2014, 52) of each word of a claim and then tracing the practical difference the claim’s being true would make. One may then discover that certain claims are impermissible because their practical consequences are undesirable or contravene accepted laws, or one may discover that claims that previously seemed to oppose one another cannot be traced to any practical difference and thus, as James explains, that “the alternatives mean practically the same thing, and all dispute is idle” (2014, 45).
James gives the following example of the pragmatic method. A man tries to catch sight of a squirrel clinging to the trunk of a tree by running around the tree, but the squirrel, too, darts around the tree such that it is always on the opposite side of the trunk to the man. This scenario gives rise to a metaphysical dispute between those who claim that the man goes around the squirrel and those who claim he does not. James explains that this dispute can be ended by deciding what is practically meant by ‘going around’ the squirrel. If it means that the man passes from the north of the squirrel to the east, then the south, then the west, then back to the north, then the man does go around the squirrel. If, on the other hand, it means that the man passes from being in front of the squirrel to being to its right, then behind it, then to its left, and finally back in front of it, then the man does not go around the squirrel. Thus, cashing out the practical significance of ‘going around’ the squirrel either way settles the dispute.
James notes that to follow the pragmatic method is “to interpret each notion by tracing its respective practical consequences” (2014, 45), and because of this, the method can be described as one of interpretive analysis. Yet, because it involves tracing an interpretation of a claim to a set of practical consequences, like Peirce’s pragmatistic analysis, from which it is developed, it may also be described as a method of connective analysis.
(For discussion of James’ philosophy, see the entry on William James.)
Susanne Katherina Langer
In her book Philosophy in a New Key, first published in 1941, Langer, influenced by the work on symbolism done by philosophers such as Peirce and Cassirer, develops a new philosophy of meaning, which she describes as “an analysis of relational patterns in which ‘meaning’ may be sought” (1957, 66). Meaning, claims Langer, is not a property of terms —e.g., something that terms carry with them—but a function of terms. What she means by this is that meaning is a relational pattern of terms or an arrangement of multiple terms. The primary terms of Langer’s new philosophy of meaning are signs and symbols. A sign is understood as something that announces or indicates the existence, whether it be in the past, present, or future, of something else, its object. Langer gives the example of lightning and thunder (ibid., 58). Taking lightning to be the sign, it indicates the (future) existence of its object, thunder. Alternatively, taking thunder to be the sign, it indicates the (past) existence of its object, lightning. Whether thunder or lightning is taken to be the sign is decided by a subject or interpretant. In the case of signs, then, meaning can be found through the analysis of the relational patterns of the three terms: subject, sign, and object (ibid., 64). Symbols, unlike signs, do not indicate the existence of an object but, rather, serve, as Langer puts it, “as vehicles for the conception of objects” (ibid., 60–1). The symbol ‘Susanne Langer’, for instance, does not indicate the existence of the person who went by that name—I do not look around my room for her if I hear the name—but instead invokes in me, the subject, a conception of a philosopher who, among other things, received her PhD from Radcliffe College in 1926 and went on to do ground-breaking work in philosophy of meaning and aesthetics. Of course, as Langer explains, the symbol ‘Susanne Langer’ also names or ‘denotes’ something, its object, that the conception is of, namely, Susanne Langer the person (ibid., 63–4). Thus, in the case of symbols and denotation, meaning is to be found through the analysis of the relational patterns of the four terms: subject, symbol, conception, and object (ibid., 64). Langer’s analysis of relational patterns exhibits both interpretive analysis, in that different terms need to be interpreted as sign, symbol, conception, and object, as well as connective analysis, in that the different terms must be understood relationally.
(For further discussion of Langer’s symbolism, see The History of Western Philosophy of Music: since 1800, § 2.3.
8. Phenomenology
Phenomenology was initially elaborated in the first half of the twentieth century by, among others, Edmund Husserl (1859–1938), Martin Heidegger (1889–1976), Edith Stein (1891–1942), Gerda Walther (1897–1977), and Maurice Merleau-Ponty (1908–1961). It is the study and theory of the nature of experience and often involves a focus on intentionality.
Gerda Walther
As stated in the main article, the eidetic reduction method of Husserl’s phenomenology is intended to facilitate the isolation of the essences of various forms of thinking. Integral to this method is the act of ‘bracketing’ or the epoché. By this act, one suspends the question of whether objects of consciousness are actual (real). Walther, in A Contribution to the Ontology of Social Communities, explains that this means that when the method of phenomenological reduction is adhered to, an object is regarded as the “intentional correlate of a lived experience [intentionales Korrelat eines Erlebnisses]” of a pure I (1922, 9), which I is the “abstract-formal moment of viewing and making actual, actual pure lived experiences” (ibid., 13). Walther opposes phenomenological reduction to ontological reduction, which puts aside “everything empirically accidental” in order to isolate the pure essences of objects (“the pure ‘What’ of the various objects”), where these essences are understood as real (ibid., 4). When we drop phenomenological reduction, Walther claims, we can speak of a ‘real I’, or a ‘concrete I-point’, that is the source point (Quellpunkt) of lived experiences (ibid., 13). This real I, in its relation to social communities, is a primary focus of Walther’s work.
While it may seem that Walther regards ontology as more important than phenomenology, the opposite is in fact true. Walther regards phenomenology as superior to ontology because, as she writes, it treats of “any apprehension and givenness of being, therefore also of the essences of conscious lived experience [Bewusstseinserlebnisse]” (1922, 4). The investigation of the essence of the I thus falls within the purview of phenomenology.
(For further discussion, see the entry on The Phenomenology of the Munich and Göttingen Circles.)
Maurice Merleau-Ponty
In the preface to his Phenomenology of Perception, Merleau-Ponty articulates his understanding of phenomenology and its method. Phenomenology, on his view, discloses our pre-reflective situation as subjects in the world. Husserl’s method of eidetic reduction does not, therefore, have the goal of isolating essences. Essences, Merleau-Ponty states, “must bring with them all of the living relations of experience, like the net draws up both quivering fish and seaweed from the seabed” (1945, lxxix). Essences are thus the means by which the world, and our pre-reflective engagement in the world, may be disclosed. The true goal of eidetic reduction is, accordingly, this disclosure. “The most important lesson of the reduction”, Merleau-Ponty asserts, is that, because all our reflections on the world and our situation in it must take place in the ‘temporal flow’ of the world, a complete reduction is impossible (ibid., lxxvii–lxxviii).
(For discussion of Merleau-Ponty’s philosophy, see the entry on Maurice Merleau-Ponty.)
9. Indian Philosophy
British colonialism had a devastating effect on Indian philosophy in the modern period. It did serious damage to the rich analytic tradition that had developed in the early modern period (see the supplementary section on Indian Analytic Philosophy). The story of this has still to be written, although an important contribution has been made by Jonardon Ganeri in The Lost Age of Reason (2011), dealing with the period from 1450 to 1700. The issues are complicated, however, since it is not a straightforward matter of the suppression of Indian philosophy, but of varying and disputed conceptions of Indian philosophy by both Indian thinkers and European philosophers.
An example of this is given by Ganeri. In 1895 Swami Vivekananda described the Indian (Nyāya) analytic tradition as offering “an analysis of the laws of reasoning in some points superior to every other system in the whole world, expressed in a wonderful and precise mosaic of language, ... respected and studied throughout the length and breadth of Hindusthān”. Just seven years later he says to a student in Bengal: “Why do you not set about propogating Vedānta in your part of the country? ... open a Sanskrit school there and teach the Upaniṣads and the Brahma-sūtras ... I have heard that in your country there is much logic-chopping of the Nyāya school. What is there in it? Only vyāpti [pervasion] and anumāna [inference]—on these subjects the paṇdits of the Nyāya school discuss for months! What does it help towards the knowledge of the ātman [the self]”. (Cited in Ganeri 2011, 248; cf. 2001a, 3–4) This reflects the tension in Indian responses to colonialism. On the one hand, they pointed out that they had their own native ‘analytic’ tradition, rivalling those in Europe. On the other hand, they stressed the uniqueness of their own philosophical tradition by urging a return to the Vedic sources.
This tension was also mirrored in attitudes towards Indian philosophy in Europe. Evaluations of the Nyāya inference-schema provide an excellent case study. In a paper published in the Transactions of the Royal Asiatic Society in 1824, entitled ‘The Philosophy of the Hindus: On the Nyāya and Vaiśeṣika Systems’, which introduced these systems to Europe, Henry Colebrooke called this inference-schema a ‘syllogism’, which inevitably prompted comparison with Aristotelian logic. A positive evaluation of what became known as the ‘Hindu syllogism’ threatened the supposed superiority of European logic, and criticisms were made of its lack of rigour—in being five-membered (in the Nyāya version) rather than three-membered. Sir William Hamilton, for example, alleged in 1852 that “The Hindu syllogism is merely a clumsy agglutination of ... counterforms, being enounced, 1st, analytically, 2nd, synthetically” (cited in Ganeri 2001a, 10). Max Müller defended the inference-schema from the charge of superfluity by assigning it to Rhetoric rather than Logic, but he still concluded: “I should like to see the Brahmans themselves take up the gauntlet and defend their Logic against the attacks of European critics. Till very lately they entertained a very low opinion of European Logic, some account of which had been supplied to them from the popular work of Abercrombie [a textbook of the time].” (1853 [2001a], 73–4) The rhetoric here is clear: it is for the Indians to learn European logic, so that they could appreciate what ‘logic’ properly was. Here is another judgement made at the time by E. Röer:
That Hindu philosophy will have any great influence on the development of European philosophy and mediately of European civilization must be denied. You are compelled to think by reading the works of the Greeks, they introduce you into the process of their thoughts, and by this force you to accompany them with your own thoughts, until you arrive as it were by your own mind at the principles of their systems ... The Hindus, on the other hand, are dogmatical. They commence synthetically with a statement of their principles, yet do not condescend to unfold the train of thought which has led them. (1850, iv–v; cited in Ganeri 2001a, 14)
Here we have a sharp opposition between ‘analytic’ thinking, which enables you to work back to the principles of thinking for yourself, and ‘synthetic’ thinking, which just states the principles without explaining them. That this supposed opposition is so dogmatically stated, without condescending to explain it, is only one of the ironies of the passage.
It is perhaps not surprising, in being told of the inferiority of Indian logic compared with European logic, that some Indian philosophers returned to the Vedic sources and emphasized the more mystical aspects of Hindu philosophy in a deliberate challenge to dry and soul-less ‘analytic’ philosophy—just as the Romantics had criticized analysis in responding to Enlightenment thinking. Sarvepalli Radhakrishna, who was Spalding Chair of Eastern Religion and Ethics at Oxford from 1936 to 1952 (when he became the first vice president of India), summed it up as follows: “The whole course of Hindu philosophy is a continuous affirmation of the truth that insight into reality does not come through analytical intellect” (1937 [1977], 65). In reacting to British colonialism, the Indian nationalism that emerged was drawn to ideas and traditions that were as different as possible to European ones, and this hindered appreciation of their own analytic heritage.
Since the pioneering work of Matilal (who held the Spalding Chair from 1976 to his death in 1991) in the 1970s and 1980s, there has been growing appreciation of Indian analytic philosophy, but there is still much work to be done in exploring—and learning from—their varied and fruitful analytic techniques. The imperialism of Western analytic philosophy needs to be subjected to analytical critique informed by knowledge of the rich diversity of forms of analysis in the history of philosophy.
(For further discussion, see Ganeri 2001a, where several of the pieces referred to here are reprinted.)
10. Chinese Philosophy
The late nineteenth century was a turning-point in the history of Chinese philosophy. The gradual disintegration of the Qing dynasty (1644–1911) prompted a turn to the West for intellectual renewal and scientific development. Logical and philosophical texts were translated (initially through Japanese), the first universities were established at the turn of the twentieth century, and the new generation of Chinese students and intellectuals were encouraged to travel to Europe and the US to broaden their education. One was Zhang Shizhao (1881–1973), who studied at the University of Aberdeen and while there wrote his famous essay ‘On the Meanings of Names in Translation’, offering arguments for what is now the standard translation of ‘logic’ into Chinese, ‘luójí (邏輯)’ (see Beaney and Liang 2023). Another was Hu Shi (1891–1962), who gained his doctorate at Columbia University in 1919, subsequently published in 1922, on The Development of the Logical Method in Ancient China. This offered the first history of Chinese philosophy in English, and played a major role in establishing what is now taken as the canon, which includes not just the well-known figures in Confucianism (Kongzi, Mengzi, Xunzi) and Daoism (Laozi, Zhuangzi) but also Mozi (the founder of Mohism) and Hui Shi and Gongsun Long (of the School of Names), who can be seen as forming an analytic tradition in ancient Chinese philosophy (see the supplementary section on Ancient Chinese Philosophy). Hu Shi’s book marks the introduction of Western analytic methods both in understanding Chinese philosophy and in fostering it. He writes: “That philosophy is conditioned by its method, and that the development of philosophy is dependent upon the development of the logical method, are facts which find abundant illustrations in the history of philosophy both of the West and of the East” (1922, 1). In seeking to revive Chinese philosophy and combat the dominance of Confucianism, he drew on the work of the Mohists and Neo-Mohists, in particular.
In 1920–21 Bertrand Russell visited China and gave a series of lectures on analytic philosophy and the new mathematical logic, which encouraged its study among the new generation of Chinese philosophers in Beijing, especially (see Zhou 2016–17; Zhou and Linsky 2018). Led by Jin Yuelin (1895–1984), who visited Britain in 1922, a ‘new realist school’ formed at Tsinghua University to promote the new analytic philosophy. Wittgenstein’s Tractatus was translated by Zhang Shenfu (1893–1986) in 1927, and when Hung Tscha (1909–92) returned to China in 1937 after writing his doctorate under Schlick’s supervision in Vienna, logical positivism was also introduced to China.
Two other twentieth-century Chinese philosophers can be mentioned here. Zhang Dainian (1909–2004) published a Handbook of Categories and Concepts in Classical Chinese Philosophy in 1948 (revised in 1989, with an English translation in 2002), which essentially offers conceptual analyses—with Chinese characteristics—of key philosophical concepts. Lao Si-guang (1927–) published A New Account of Chinese Philosophy in 1982, in which he identifies the fundamental questions of Chinese philosophy and shows how they have been answered through its history. In doing so he admits that what China lacks is analytical skills, which need to be imported from the West (1982, preface). (For further discussion of modern Chinese historiography of philosophy, see Beaney 2019, 753–7.)
As Chinese philosophy develops in the twenty-first century, there is a growing tradition of interest in ‘mainstream’ analytic philosophy, which is gradually beginning to offer new perspectives on standard debates as Chinese philosophers contribute by drawing on their own language and culture. At the same time the influence of contemporary analytic philosophy is filtering through to other Chinese philosophical traditions. New forms and conceptions of analysis will undoubtedly emerge in the resultant intercultural philosophical space (for a recent example, see Beaney 2021).
11. Conclusion
Modern philosophy from the nineteenth century onwards is rich in forms and conceptions of analysis, even if we exclude the tradition that began to develop at the turn of the twentieth century and came to be known as analytic philosophy (as we will see in the supplementary document that follows on Conceptions of Analysis in Modern Analytic Philosophy). Decompositional, regressive and connective conceptions may have prevailed—as opposed to the interpretive (logical) conception that was characteristic of analytic philosophy (in both its early modern Indian and later European varieties)—but practices and projects of analysis there certainly were. There was also vigorous debate about the legitimacy and limits of the various kinds of analysis, which formed the broader context in which modern analytic philosophy originated and evolved into the dominant tradition that it is now seen as being.