Judaic and Islamic Objections

With rare exceptions atheists and naturalists don’t bother to criticize trinitarian doctrines, beyond the passing joke or dismissal, rightly seeing issues about monotheism generally, and about the teachings and status of Jesus Christ as more fundamental. Serious critics of trinitarian doctrines are nearly always fellow Abrahamic monotheists. Objections by Christians are discussed in the supplementary document on the history of trinitarian doctrines section 2.2 and the supplementary document on unitarianism; here we survey Islamic and Judaic objections.

• 1. Recent Scriptural and Theological Objections
• 2. Medieval Metaphysical and Theological Objections
• 3. The Persons as Divine Attributes
• 4. Jewish and Muslim Trinitarian Parallels

1. Recent Scriptural and Theological Objections

Recent Muslim apologists argue that Jesus never claimed to be God, but only a servant and messenger of God, Paul and others having changed Jesus’ message (Mababaya 2004). Unfortunately, such works are often marred by historical inaccuracies such as reliance on the late medieval forgery The Gospel of Barnabas as a guide to Jesus’ thought and life (Geisler 2002, 303–7). Muslim apologists have always appealed to several passages in the Qur’an which appear to be directed against the Trinity and Incarnation doctrines, with the complication, however, that these passages seem to presuppose something other than the mainstream doctrines (Wolfson 1976, 304–10; Shah-Kazemi 2012, 87–88).

Gerald Sigal (2006) argues that the Christian Bible as a whole doesn’t support trinitarianism, and properly interpreted teaches many things incompatible with it, such as Jesus’ subjection to the Father and the impersonality of the holy spirit. Tovia Singer surveys New Testament teaching and concludes

Clearly, the earliest Christians did not consider Jesus to be God, and the doctrine of the Trinity was a later development in Christian thinking. After all, if the first followers of Jesus thought that Jesus was one of the three persons of the triune godhead, why didn’t a single New Testament author say so? . . . Did the Gospel writers just forget to say anything about that part of Jesus’ teachings? (2014a, 148)

Singer then surveys post-biblical theological developments and correctly pinpoints one of the creeds from the council at Constantinople in 381 as the first truly trinitarian creed (163). He then argues that it is implausible that God would have withheld such an important doctrine from all the prophets, including the great Moses (176). He also rebuts a number of favorite Old Testament proof-texts for the Trinity, such as God saying “Let us make man in our image” in Genesis 1:26 (2014b, 145–50), that the plural form of the Hebrew word elohim (usually translated as “God”) assumes, implies, or hints at God being multipersonal (2014b, 153–57), or that in saying that God is echad (“one”) Deuteronomy 6:4 implies that God is a complex unity (2014b, 133–36). In rebutting these popular misreadings Singer often cites Christian scholarship.

Traditionally Jewish polemics against Christianity did not focus much on the Trinity. In discussing polemics of the high middle ages, David Berger writes,

The trinity, which was an obvious target for logical questions, posed a peculiar problem for Jewish polemicists; they considered it so irrational that they had trouble in coming to grips with it . . . it seems clear that Jews, in effect, asked themselves . . . “What do they mean when they talk about a triune God? They say that there are three, and then they say that the three are one. But this is patent nonsense. What, then, do they believe? . . . Since they talk about the separate incarnation of one of the three persons, it is apparently the assertion of multiplicity that they really mean. In that case, I shall have to demonstrate to them that there is only one God.” It is only some such line of reasoning that can explain the persistent Jewish efforts to persuade Christians to accept monotheism on both logical and scriptural grounds . . . To the Christian polemicist . . . such arguments . . . missed the point entirely. (1991, 492–93)

Both Jewish and Muslim critics emphasize that the New Testament continues the Old Testament emphasis on the oneness of God, and they sometimes criticize trinitarianism as simple tritheism, on the grounds that a “fully divine Person” must be a god. Both sometimes allege that the New Testament is inconsistent, some parts affirming Christ to be God while others teach things inconsistent with his deity. Muslims also charge trinitarians with committing the serious sin of “associating” another with God, a charge raised in the Qur’an itself, and hold up Islam as a monotheistic religion unencumbered by mysteries. Jewish critics have also levelled the charge of “association” (Ellenson 2000, 74), but more often the charge is idolatry (Singer 2014b, 125–30).

In reply to these objections, trinitarians emphasize that by definition, the doctrine implies monotheism, and they employ arguments like those in the supplementary document on the history of trinitarian doctrines section 2.2 to show that the Bible implicitly teaches three “Persons” in the one God. Mysteries, they argue, have been revealed, and we have no grounds to rule out in principle that we’ll be faced with them in thinking about a transcendent God. Sometimes they add that non-trinitarians won’t be able to avoid (other) theological mysteries themselves. Moreover, they argue that Jesus claimed to be (fully) divine, while being subject to and inferior to God in his human nature only, and nothing has been illegitimately raised to God’s level, as Jesus and his Father are one god, though they are two Persons.

2. Medieval Metaphysical and Theological Objections

While some medieval critics, such as Ibn Taymiyya (Correct, 255–325) argue that the Christians’ own scriptures don’t support trinitarian doctrine, a number of philosophical objections to trinitarianism were developed by medieval Muslim philosopher-theologians and later deployed and developed by Jewish philosopher-theologians. One such objection was based on Aristotle’s claim that “all things that are many in number have matter” (Metaphysics XII.8, 1074a 33–34; Lasker 2007, 48–51; Wolfson 1977, 404–5). Another was the doctrine implied (as each Person was fully divine) that each divine Person must also be a Trinity, and so on, resulting in an infinity of trinities (Lasker 2007, 59–60, 72–73). (See the main entry section 5.1. ) Others urged that the doctrine wrongly implies that God is a substance with accidents, or that nothing divine could be “generated”, as that is incompatible with the divine attributes of absolute perfection, necessary existence, eternal existence, or aseity (existing solely because of oneself, or not because of anything else) (Lasker 2007, 87–88).

Many other objections center around the concept of divine simplicity. Muslim philosopher al-Kindi (ca. 800–70) understood the doctrine to assert that there are three divine Persons, three individuals, each composed of the divine essence together with its own distinctive characteristic. But whatever is composed is caused, and whatever is caused is not eternal. So the doctrine, he holds, absurdly claims that each of the Persons isn’t eternal, and since they’re all divine, each is eternal (Adamson 2006, 100; Wolfson 1976, 321–27). Others argued that the Christians mean the Persons to be really distinct (not merely distinct in thought) and identify them with or at least ground them in distinct attributes of God, which clashes with the truth of divine simplicity (Lasker 2007, 52–55, 61–62, 68, 90–92). (Cf. supplementary document on the history of trinitarian doctrines, section 4.)

Many of the above objections, both scriptural and philosophical, are answered, without citing the non-Christian source, by Thomas Aquinas in various places (Aquinas Gentiles, 35–116 [IV.1–18]; Aquinas Theologiae, I.27–43). At present, trinitarians disagree about what divine simplicity is, whether or not it is true, and whether or not rightly understood it is compatible with the Trinity doctrine rightly understood.

3. The Persons as Divine Attributes

A reoccurring theme in Muslim-Christian and Jewish-Christian debates about God is Christians implying that the Trinity should be understood as including just one self, the three “Persons” in God being his personalities or properties (e.g., God’s life, knowledge, and power), or else God being the Father, with the Son and Spirit as his properties. (See main entry section 1.) This has occurred in both recent and medieval debates (Crescas 1992, 37, 102; Ebied and Thomas 2005, 325–33; Geisler 2002, 269, 273, 276; Lasker 2007, 61–72, 78; Schwöbel 2012, 12–14; Shah-Kazemi 2012, 89–94; Thomas 2002, 69, 77; Williams 2008; van Gorder 2003, 115, 122). For example:

If only [the Muslims] knew… that we only intend by this [trinitarian doctrine] to affirm the teaching that God the exalted is living and articulate, they would not disapprove. (Ebied and Thomas 2005, 91)

Sometimes this is combined with a heavy Mysterian (see main entry section 4) emphasis which suggests that both one-self and three-self Trinity theories are false (Volf 2011, 50–59, 127–48). Less often, both three- and one-self theories are clearly denied on the basis of divine transcendence (Turner 2012).

Muslim and Jewish critics sometimes object that trinitarianism is simply tritheism. They object that both their own and the Christians’ scriptures clearly teach monotheism. If told that the “Persons” of the Trinity are merely God’s attributes, they object that the Christians arbitrarily stop at three, for surely God has more than three attributes. Moreover, that Christians stop with the stated three shows that they don’t really hold the “Persons” to be mere attributes; the move is an ad hoc defense which obscures their actual reasons for believing in the Trinity (Crescas 1992, 43; Haddad 1995, 89; Lasker 2007, 55–57, 60, 68–69, 88–89; Taymiyya Correct, 255–59; Wolfson 1977, 405–6). Again, if the doctrine is construed as merely the claim that God is called by three names (i.e., the most extreme kind of one-self Trinity theory, discussed in the main entry, section 1), they reply that God has many more than three names (Taymiyya Correct, 266–67).

4. Jewish and Muslim Trinitarian Parallels

Jewish antitrinitarian polemics are complicated by medieval mystical writings about the sefirot of God, some of which are sometimes portrayed of as “stages of God’s being, aspects of the divine personality” (Matt 1983, 33). Of them, the Zohar (c. 1286 CE) says “It [Ein Sof, the Infinite, i.e., God] is they [the sefirot], and they are it” (ibid.; cf. Scholem 1974, 101). One recent scholar refers to this as “the Decaune God” (Goshen-Gottstein 2004, 165). And an early 13th century kabbalistic writing spoke what one commentator calls “a kind of kabbalistic trinity”, namely “three hidden lights” in “the root of all roots” [i.e., God] which “constitute one essence and one root” (Scholem 1974, 95). The similarities between these and various trinitarian doctrines even led some medieval Jews to make the anachronistic claim that the trinitarian doctrine was based on a misunderstanding of the kabbalistic traditions (Lasker 2007, 75). Later, some renaissance and early modern Christians turned this around, attempting to argue from kabbalistic writings to versions of the Trinity and the Incarnation doctrines (Antognazza 2007; Coudert 1999; Scholem 1974, 196–201). Many recent scholars see the Zohar and other Kabbalistic texts as being influenced by medieval Christian trinitarianism (Sigal 2006, 140–41, 144). In fact the similarities were often noted in medieval and early modern times (Goshen-Gottstein 2004). (See also the section on Kabbalah and Monotheism in the entry on monotheism.)

A final complication for some Jewish Aristotelians was distinguishing their claim that God is thinker, thinking, and thought from Augustinian Trinity analogies (see supplementary document on the history of Trinity theories, section 3.3.2) (Lasker 2007, 77–83). (See the entry on fourteenth-century philosopher Joseph Kaspi.)

Muslim polemics are complicated by the fact that early Muslims accepted, probably under Christian influence, the doctrine that there are many real, distinct attributes or characteristics in God (Wolfson 1976, 112–238; Shah-Kazemi 2012, 94–97). This doctrine, especially noting the one-self understanding of the Trinity noted above (section 3), made it hard to draw a sharp line between Muslim and Christian conceptions of God’s unity.

Another complicating factor was the Muslim doctrine of the eternal Qur’an. Certain verses in the Qur’an were interpreted to mean that the earthly Qur’an was the revelation of a pre-existing, heavenly exemplar, a heavenly Qur’an. Thus, early Muslims believed, like many Jews, that their holy book had been created prior to the cosmos. At various points the Qur’an refers to itself as “God’s word(s)”, “knowledge”, and “wisdom”. And so when belief in distinct eternal attributes in God was dominant, belief in a created, pre-existent Qur’an was replaced by belief in an eternal, uncreated Qur’an, an attribute of God. This Word of God, is supposed to be in some sense what Muslims recite, hear, or read. But how can this eternal, non-physical reality be present in an earthly book, or in an episode of Arabic speech? Wolfson discusses this as the problem of “inlibration”, parallel to the Christian doctrine of the incarnation of the Word, also, in some sense (in the pro-Nicene and Latin traditions) a divine attribute (Wolfson 1976, 235–91; cf. Geisler 2002, 99–105; van Gorder 2003, 52). A long and complicated controversy ensued over the status of the Qur’an, but the point is that Muslim objectors had to take care when objecting to the doctrines of the Trinity and the Incarnation of Christ, lest they say something incompatible with their preferred views about the Qur’an.