Feminist Metaphysics

Metaphysics is the study of the basic structure of reality, of what there is and what it is like. It considers, for example, concepts such as identity, causation, substance, and kind, that seem to be presupposed by any form of inquiry; and it attempts to determine what there is at the most general level. For example, are there minds in addition to bodies? Do things persist through change? Is there free will or is all action determined by prior events? But since metaphysics not only concerns itself with what there is (ontology), but also the nature of that which exists, metaphysicians also ask, for example, whether numbers, if they exist, are dependent upon human thought and practices in some way, whether the concepts and categories we use to think of and describe reality influence or determine in any way what is described, and whether and how values are embodied in our categories and descriptions. Such a project might seem quite alien to feminism, which at first blush seems to be an engaged, practical, and political project aimed at liberation (a thought we'll return to in Section 2.3) but feminists have, as a matter of fact, been remarkably productive in the field of metaphysics, developing ideas, methods, and positions that have reshaped both feminism at large and metaphysics more broadly.

In this entry, we group works in feminist metaphysics under two main headings according to the way in which a feminist approach is informing the work. These do not represent defined schools of thought or sharply separated literatures, but are rather a heuristic device we employ to structure our discussion. The first group of work focuses on instances where feminism informs the content of metaphysical inquiry in the sense that the questions and topics under consideration bear on feminist projects in the world at large. This includes questions and topics that are important to understand in order to further feminist projects, and questions and topics that only come into focus when a feminist approach is taken. The second group of work focuses on the application of feminist insights to the key concepts, approaches, and methods of metaphysics. Here, feminism informs the approach to metaphysical inquiry; this may, for example, take the form of identifying male bias in existing approaches. To put this more colloquially, there are two ways in which as feminist metaphysicians we may end up doing something distinctive from metaphysics in general: we may use metaphysics to figure out things that we need to figure out as feminists and/or that we only noticed because we’re feminists, and we may approach general metaphysical investigations in different ways because we are feminists.

• 1. Metaphysical Questions with Feminist Significance
  • 1.1. Social Construction
    • 1.1.1 Idea and Object Construction
    • 1.1.2 The Debunking Project
    • 1.1.3 Ameliorative Inquiry
  • 1.2. Intersectionality
  • 1.3 Social Structures and Social Systems
    • 1.3.1. The Nature of Social Structures and Social Systems
    • 1.3.2. The Explanatory Value of Social Structures and Social Systems
    • 1.3.3. The Individuation and Interaction of Social Structures and Social Systems
  • 1.4 Pregnancy
• 2. Feminist Metaphysical Frameworks
  • 2.1 Relations
  • 2.2 Dualisms
  • 2.3 Metametaphysics
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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1. Metaphysical Questions with Feminist Significance

The most prominent example of metaphysical questions that bear importantly on feminist political projects are questions about the nature of sex and/or gender. These questions are explored in detail in the entry Feminist Perspectives on Sex and Gender. Accordingly, we will not discuss them here, except to illustrate broader points, though readers should be aware that the category of works not discussed here for this reason includes many influential and significant contributions to feminist metaphysics. Here we will focus on other significant feminist contributions to metaphysics, not least the structure of social reality, and the relationship between the social and natural world more broadly. Because social structures are often justified as natural, or necessary to control what’s natural, feminists have questioned whether such references to nature are legitimate. This has led to considerable work on the idea of social construction that is not limited to the social construction of gender (or sex, for that matter). Feminists have also sought to understand the metaphysical aspects of ‘intersectionality’, along with the ways in which social categories (such as gender and race) and social structures (such as sexism/patriarchy and racism/white supremacy) are intertwined and co-dependant. Moreover, there has been a recent surge of interest in the metaphysics of pregnancy.

1.1. Social Construction

Perhaps the area where feminist metaphysicians have made the greatest strides, and had the most influence, is in the theory of social construction.^[1] In trying to understand the nature of gender and patriarchal oppression, feminist metaphysicians have developed new tools for understanding and critiquing different aspects of social reality. Such tools have been taken up by social ontologists and now constitute a mainstream part of social ontology. Given that uptake, many of these tools are now covered in the entry on Social Ontology. As such, in this section we will highlight three particularly influential feminist contributions to social ontology that capture the distinctively political approach to social ontology that feminist metaphysicians have taken.

1.1.1 Idea and Object Construction

Suppose I say “sex is a social construct”. One reading of this claim is that our genitalia, karyotype, secondary sex characteristics and so on, are literally constructed through social practices. That is, some group of objects out there in the world (ovaries, penises, etc.,) is brought into existence or otherwise dependent on our social practices. Another reading of this claim is that our concept or ideas about sex categories are dependent on social practices. That is, our lumping together or grouping of these aspects of the world (ovaries, penises, etc.,) under the label ‘sex’ is dependent on social practices. This is a long way of saying that we can distinguish the construction of ideas and the construction of objects (Hacking 1999: 9–16).^[2]

Now, there’s a fairly obvious sense in which our concepts and ideas are dependent on our social practices. We get taught them through education and language, and our concepts evolve over time due to social, historical, and technological change. Even if one thinks that certain scientific concepts perfectly map onto reality as things truly are, carving nature at its joints, one still has to recognise that the scientific development of these concepts is a socio-historical process: scientific practice is a social practice, after all. Moreover, scientific practice is not independent of wider social, economic, and historical forces. Recognising that the concepts and ideas we use to interpret the world are not (straightforwardly) ‘read from nature’s joints’ prompts us to ask questions about the adequacy of our interpretive conceptual framework. Concepts help us organize phenomena; different concepts organize it in different ways. It is important, then, to ask: what phenomena are highlighted and what are eclipsed by a particular framework of concepts? What assumptions are built into the framework?

For example, our everyday framework for thinking about human beings is structured by the assumptions that there are two (and only two) sexes, and that every human is either a male or a female. But in fact a significant percentage of humans have a mix of male and female anatomical features. Intersex people are eclipsed in our everyday framework (Fausto-Sterling 2000). This should invite us to ask: Why? Whose interests are served, if anyone’s, by intersex people being ignored in the dominant conceptual framework? (It can’t be plausibly argued that sex isn’t important enough to us to make fine-grained distinctions between bodies!) Further, once we recognize intersex people, how should we revise our conceptual framework? Should we group people into more than two sexes, or are there reasons instead to complicate the definitions of male and female to include everyone in just two sex categories? More generally, on what basis should we decide what categories to use? (Fausto-Sterling 2000; Butler 1999: Ch. 1) In asking these questions it is important to remember that an idea or conceptual framework may be inadequate without being false, e.g., a claim might be true and yet incomplete, misleading, unjustified, biased, etc. (Anderson 1995).

What about the other sort of reading of construction claims, that there is some object or thing ‘out there’ in the world that is the result of, or dependent on, our social practices? There is a sense in which any artifact is a construction; but claiming that scissors, bridges, or cars are social constructions would not have much point, given how mundane this claim would be.^[3] Social constructionists, on the whole, are arguing for surprising theses that they believe challenge our everyday view of things. It is, after all, rather surprising to say that groups like women, Asian-Americans, child abusers or refugees are social constructions.

One way in which an object can be socially constructed is via social causation: here, to say that something is socially constructed is to say that it is caused to be a certain way, and the causal process involves social factors, e.g., social forces were largely responsible for my coming to have the idea of a husband, and social forces are largely responsible for any given person becoming a husband. But often when theorists argue that something is a social construction, their point is not about causation. Rather, the point is to distinguish social kinds from physical kinds. What it is to be a member of the category husband is to play a particular role in certain social practices, such as weddings and marriage. Without such social practices there simply would be no husbands at all. One way of putting this is that being a husband is constituted by (participation in) certain social practices or structures.

Whilst there has been work looking at the constitutive social construction of sex, it may be easier to begin by thinking about this idea using the example of gender. In the case of gender, the point is that gender is not a classification scheme based simply on anatomical or biological differences, but rather marks social differences between individuals. We can think of gender in these constitutive terms. Gender, in this sense at least, is not about testicles and ovaries, the penis and the uterus, but about a system of social categories, social practices, social roles, and/or social structures which constitute what it is to be a member of a given gender (see, e.g., Haslanger 2012; also Wittig 1992; Delphy 1984; MacKinnon 1989). Consider, for example, the category of landlords. To be a landlord one must be located within a broad system of social and economic relations which includes tenants, private property, and the like. Imagine that, by some coincidence, all and only landlords have a mole behind their left ear. Even if this were the case, having this physical mark is not what it is to be a landlord. What makes one a landlord is that one holds a certain position in an economic structure, and plays a roles in certain economic practices by leasing out one’s property.^[4]

Could sex also be constitutively socially constructed? Certainly it’s a much more controversial claim: whilst an individual’s genitalia might be causally socially constructed (via e.g., gender-affirming surgery) it seems much harder to argue that (say) vaginas are constituted by social practices. One strategy that some feminists have adopted here is to attempt to show that sex as a set of categories is dependent on gender. After all, if gender is a set of social practices, and our norms for categorising people into different sexes is somehow dependent on or constituted by gender, then sex (at least in this sense) is socially constructed. Drawing on Monique Wittig, Judith Butler makes an argument that can be read in this way:

The demarcation of anatomical difference does not precede the cultural interpretation of that difference, but is itself an interpretive act laden with normative assumptions. That infants are divided into sexes at birth, Wittig points out, serves the social ends of reproduction, but they might just as well be differentiated on the basis of ear lobe formation or, better still, not be differentiated on the basis of anatomy at all. In demarcating ‘sex’ as sex, we construct certain norms of differentiation. (Butler 1986, 47).

Our practices of sexing children take place in a cisheteropatriarchal society that features a binary gender system. Moreover, (despite resistance from trans people) this society insists that sex and gender need to be aligned: indeed this society implicitly claims that sex is the basis for gender. But what if this gets things the wrong way around? This Butlerian argument suggests that society, via sexing practices and surgical interventions on intersex children, is imposing a binary sex system on a messy, complex biological reality that is far from featuring two neat binary categories. According to this Butlerian line of argument, gender (at least in contemporary society) precedes sex, and constructs sex categories in an attempt to justify a binary gender system: “Instead of sex being a natural category, and gender the social significance of sex, sex is really a gendered category posited by us and claimed to be a natural one so that it can help perpetuate the gender game” (Ásta 2018, 66). Of course, whether this sort of argument works and whether the resulting metaphysical picture is attractive has been widely debated in feminist metaphysics (see e.g., Namaste 2000; Prosser 1998; Butler 1993; Stone 2007; Colebrook 2017; see also the entry on Feminist Perspectives on Sex and Gender §3.3).

It is also significant that not all social kinds are obviously social. Sometimes it is assumed that the conditions for membership in a kind concern only or primarily biological or physical facts. Pointing out that this is wrong can have important consequences. For example, the idea that whether or not a person is a woman is not simply a matter of their physical features, but concerns their position in a social matrix, has been politically significant, and to many surprising. How should we construe the constructionist move of arguing that a particular kind is a social kind? What could be interesting or radical about such a move? Feminist metaphysicians have explored this question under the label ‘the debunking project’.

1.1.2 The Debunking Project

Social ontology in feminist thought can be traced to a number of sources, but perhaps the most prominent is Simone de Beauvoir’s claim that “One is not born, but rather becomes, woman” (Beauvoir 1949/2011, 293). In claiming that one is not born a woman, Beauvoir was not suggesting that one is never born with body parts like breasts or ovaries; rather, her concern was that possession of certain body parts, in and of itself, does not imply how one could or should be socially situated. In spite of this, societies (for the most part) reserve for people with vaginas and breasts certain social roles, norms, and activities that disadvantage them in relation to those with penises and testes. This hierarchy of advantage is legitimated, claims de Beauvoir, by casting the social order as necessary because it is tied to these apparently natural features of men and women (Beauvoir 1949/2011: Ch.1; the literature on de Beauvoir interpretation here is also vast: see the entry on Simone de Beauvoir).

This theme—that hierarchies are sustained through myths of their natural basis, and that their social basis is obscured—has prompted a tremendous amount of work on the construction of gender, race, sexuality and beyond.^[5] Research in history, anthropology, literature, and sociology has chronicled the various mechanisms by which gender and other such categories are enforced, and research in psychology and biology has further loosened the ties between body types and social roles. Having witnessed the power of naturalizing “myths”, feminists tend to be wary of any suggestion that a category is “natural” or that what’s “natural” should dictate how we organize ourselves socially. By contrast, if it is recognized, as Beauvoir urged, that what women and men are is at least partly a social matter, this opens up the possibility that gender roles could and indeed should be made more equitable through social change.

As such, many feminist metaphysicians have argued that a necessary part of feminist praxis will involve debunking claims that gender and other such categories are i) natural, ii) inevitable, and iii) without need of justification. (Note that, contrary to a popular misconception, claiming that something is socially constructed is not about claiming that that something isn’t real! Social constructionists broadly tend to be realists about the things that get socially constructed, though this realism comes in stronger and weaker forms—see the entry on Social Ontology.) As Ásta puts it,

A paradigm case of such a debunking project is to reveal a kind or category as a social category when it is widely held to be a natural one. The consequences of this are that the constraints and enablements that come with membership in the kind are then revealed to need justification; these constraints and enablements are shown not to be the result of some natural order of things, beyond the demand for justification. (Ásta 2018, 36).

If Ásta is right, then feminist metaphysicians are, at least in part asserting the constructedness of gender in order to show that it is not inevitable that we order our society in the way that we currently organise things. Once we recognise that things might be otherwise, we can demand justification for the current gender order, and, finding such putative justifications of an oppressive social structure unconvincing, we sow the seeds for political change.

However, some feminist metaphysicians have disputed the link between i) on the one hand, and ii) and iii) on the other. That is, they have denied that something being natural implies that it is inevitable and not in need of justification. As Louise Antony pointed out, it is uncontroversial that many people are nearsighted naturally, but we would be simply wrong to suggest that this is unchangeable: we can, using things like glasses and laser surgery, alleviate nearsightedness (Antony 2000, 12). Moreover, given that such options can be made available, the nearsighted person is well within their rights to call into question any justification that might be offered for not giving them access to those options. Applying this thought directly to the case of gender, the Xenofeminist collective Laboria Cuboniks put it forcefully: “If nature is unjust, change nature!” (Cuboniks 2018, 93).^[6]

The upshot of this Antony-Cuboniks line of argument is that we don’t need a debunking project in order to undermine the claims that the current order of things is inevitable and that it is not in need of justification. But this leaves us with a question: what is the role that claims about the social construction of categories like gender are playing in feminist metaphysics? Sure, they may well be true, but absent the debunking project, it’s unclear what role such construction claims play in politically engaged metaphysics. One option here is to argue that “gender is a social construct” is a political slogan, akin to Audre Lorde’s “For the master’s tools will never dismantle the master’s house” (Lorde 2017, 91). Of course, there are lots of ways to read political slogans, but one such way is as action-guiding. By employing the slogan “gender is a social construct”, we suggest that gender is to be changed by a particular group of social mechanisms. In doing so, we avoid using the wrong methods for attempting to change gender. The claim that gender is a social construct, on this account, becomes a claim about the tactics and strategies that we ought to use in order to disrupt the current gender order.^[7]

1.1.3 Ameliorative Inquiry

Sally Haslanger points out that when researching social concepts, there are a number of types of project that we could undertake (Haslanger 2012). One option would be a traditional philosophical inquiry, analysing the concept as we take it to be – the manifest concept. Another would be an empirical inquiry studying the concept that actually gets used in practice – the operative concept. Think, for instance, of a teacher, who (for whatever reason) thinks of the category parent solely in terms of biological progenitors. However, when it comes to sending out invitations for school parents evenings, the teacher sends out invites to all primary caregivers and guardians of the children in their class, regardless of whether or not they are biological progenitors of their children. In this example the teacher has a manifest concept of parent as biological progenitor, and an operative concept of parent as primary caregiver. However, we might also ask, what concept of parent should the teacher be using?

This kind of question motivates what Haslanger has called ‘ameliorative inquiry’: inquiry into the concepts that we ought to use, given our particular goals. This is an explicitly normative methodology, driven by a variety of values that we might want in a given concept, whether those are epistemic values (such as simplicity, fruitfulness, and exactness, c.f, Carnap 1962) or moral and political values (such as taking people’s agency seriously, promoting justice, and explaining inequality).^[8] Consulting these values, and the pragmatic constraints of the context that one has in mind, the ameliorative theorist figures out which concept of (say) parent we ought to use, designing a new one if none of the existing concepts work, or calling for abolition if no concept will work at all.

As Haslanger famously put it, rather than simply asking ‘what is gender?’ or ‘what is race?’ the ameliorative theorist asks, ‘what do we want gender to be?’ and ‘what do we want race to be?’ However, put this way, one is liable to misunderstand ameliorative analysis as Haslanger conducts it. The question ‘what do we want race to be?’ might seem like it is asking what we want our racial categories to look like in the future, or what race might look like (if it exists at all) in a less racist world. However, Haslanger is more interested in asking what the best concept of race is for explaining, understanding, and critiquing existing racial oppression and racist social structures. Matthew J. Cull has described the distinction here as one between positive ameliorative critique and negative ameliorative critique:

Haslanger is pointing to what she takes to be a useful concept for understanding extant oppressive society and asks us to take political action to do away with the social structures that her concept picks out. This is not a guide for how to organize society in the future (beyond a very limited sense: ‘don’t do things this way!’ seems like a clear conclusion for any reader of Haslanger). The task of thinking about what concepts we want to use in guiding how we organize society in the future, then, can and does come apart from the task of thinking about what concepts allow us to best understand and critique existing society. Let us call the former (interested, as it is, in tearing down an unjust old world) ‘negative critique’ and the latter (interested in building a new, more just, world) ‘positive critique’. (Cull 2024, 18).

Haslanger’s negative ameliorative critique leads her to accounts of gender and race in terms of hierarchical social structures, accounts which have been the subject of intense scrutiny over the past two decades (see e.g., Mills 2014, Jones 2014, Haslanger 2014, Mikkola 2016, Bettcher 2012 and Jenkins 2016). Whether or not she is right about the particular concepts of gender and race that we ought to use, her work in laying out ameliorative inquiry as a philosophical method has led to the (re)birth of the growing field of conceptual engineering (see, e.g., Burgess and Plunkett 2013; Burgess, Cappelen and Plunkett 2020; and Cappelen 2018).^[9] Meanwhile, feminist metaphysicians have taken up Haslanger’s methodology in a variety of ways. One key area of work here has been alternative ameliorative accounts of gender that take trans experiences seriously. Here, for example, Katharine Jenkins has put forward a dualist account of gender (Jenkins 2016), whilst Matthew J. Cull has used a positive ameliorative analysis of gender to argue for pluralism about gender (Cull 2024). However, feminist metaphysicians have not limited themselves to ameliorative accounts of gender. For example, Kate Manne has offered an ameliorative account of misogyny and sexism (Manne 2016), Deborah Mühlebach and Emily McWilliams have advocated for the adoption of ameliorative methods in epistemology (Mühlebach 2016; McWilliams 2022), and Emily McGill has interpreted the feminist debates over relational autonomy as attempts at ameliorative inquiry (McGill 2020). Meanwhile, Robin Dembroff has developed an ameliorative account of sexuality (Dembroff 2016), and Elizabeth Barnes has used the method to provide an account of disability (Barnes 2016).^[10]

1.2. Intersectionality

The concept of ‘intersectionality’ draws attention to the ways in which ostensibly different modes of domination, oppression, or discrimination, such as race and gender, are intermeshed in complex ways such that it is often impossible to fully distinguish one dimension from another in a person’s experience.^[11] Although the idea has a longer history, especially in feminist thought and activism undertaken by Black women and women of colour (see, for example, Combahee River Collective 1978; Moraga and Anzaldúa 1981/2015, along with antecedents in the 19th century such as Sojourner Truth's famous “Ain't I a Woman?” speech), the term was introduced by the philosopher and legal scholar Kimberlé Williams Crenshaw in the context of theorising the failure of U.S. anti-discrimination law to protect Black women. Since Black women were required to prove discrimination the grounds of either race or sex, in order to bring a successful case they needed to show that the discriminatory treatment also extended to either Black men (in order to show it was on the grounds of race) or White women (in order to show it was on the grounds of sex). This meant that discrimination directed at Black women specifically could not be effectively identified or addressed within the U.S. legal system. Crenshaw described Black women as occupying an “intersection” between race and sex/gender, using the metaphor of a traffic intersection or road junction: “If an accident happens at an intersection, it can be caused by cars traveling from any number of directions and, sometimes, from all of them” (Crenshaw 1989, 149). Similarly, Crenshaw argued, when Black women suffered discrimination this could be (a) on the grounds of sex, (b) on the grounds of race, (c) a result of “the combined effects” of both race and sex discrimination simultaneously, or (d) a more distinctive form of discrimination that is “not the sum of race and sex discrimination, but [discrimination] as Black women” (149). In a paper published soon afterwards, Crenshaw (1991) extended her analysis by arguing that social movement organization and advocacy also frequently overlook the distinctive vulnerabilities of Black women and other women of colour. Crenshaw’s work in these papers built on earlier work by women of colour arguing that attempts to specify the nature of racial oppression without reference to gender tend to end up focusing on the experiences of men of colour, whilst attempts to specify the nature of gendered oppression without reference to race tend to end up focusing on the experiences of White women (hooks 1981; Hull, Scott, and Smith 1982). The result of such a non-intersectional approach, intersectionality’s proponents tend to argue, is an analysis that is empirically inadequate for explaining the ways in which oppression features in the lives of women of colour, and other groups situated at the intersections of forms of oppression that are often theorized as distinct.

Over the intervening decades, intersectionality has emerged as “a method and a disposition, a heuristic and analytic tool” (Carbado et. al. 2013, 303) used frequently across many disciplines including law, politics, and sociology, and philosophy. Overall, the concept of intersectionality encourages us to see racism, sexism, heterosexism, disablism, classism, and other modes of domination as intermeshed, rather than separate, and draws our attention to the dangers of trying to analyse them in isolation from one another. There is, however, no consensus over where the boundaries of the phenomenon of intersectionality lie; for example, Patricia Hill Collins uses the term ‘matrix of domination’ to refer to the complex interlocking of oppressive societal organizations, reserving ‘intersectionality’ for interlocking that manifests within a person’s lived experience, but many other theorists would use the term ‘intersectionality’ for both levels (Collins 2000: 18; for discussion, see Bilge 2010). Significant political disagreements also characterise the literature on intersectionality; for example, Sirma Bilge argues that as the concept of intersectionality has become more widely used, it has also been ‘commodified and colonized for neoliberal regimes’, stripping it of its roots in radical politics and neutralizing its political potential (Bilge 2013, 407).

In terms of metaphysics, Crenshaw and many others emphasise that intersectionality should not be understood as a specific theoretical position or claim but rather as “a heuristic term to focus attention on the vexed dynamics of difference and the solidarities of sameness in the context of antidiscrimination and social movement politics” (Cho, Crenshaw, and McCall 2013, 787). In a similar spirit, Ann Garry arguers for treating intersectionality as a “framework checker” (2011, 830) for accounts of oppression, social kinds, identity, and so on, rather than as a substantive account of these things. But although intersectionality does not provide a position on specific metaphysical questions, the use of intersectionality as a heuristic or framework checker has shaped several strands of inquiry in feminist metaphysics. Most notably, perhaps, debates about the nature of sex and/or gender kinds or categories have been closely concerned with the ways in which intersectionality complicates talk of, for example, “women’s social situation”; see the entry on Feminist Perspectives on Sex and Gender, section 3.

When the concept of intersectionality is applied to metaphysical questions about the nature of oppression, it can be seen as potentially justifying four claims. The first claim is that oppression is non-additive, which is to say that we cannot rely on being able to gain knowledge about Black women’s oppression, for example, simply by adding together some general claims about race-based oppression and some general claims gender-based oppression. Experiences of oppression (and indeed privilege) are often ‘more than the sum of their parts’, or as Crenshaw puts it, “the intersectional experience is greater than the sum of racism and sexism” (1989, 140). Taking a blanketly additive approach is a recipe for building a picture of oppression that only does justice to the experiences of the most relatively privileged members of the oppressed group – for example, an account of women’s oppression that centres the experiences of white, middle-class, heterosexual women and overlooks or belies the experiences of women of colour, working class women, and queer women (Spelman 1988, Ch. 6). This recognition is compatible with allowing that in some specific cases, dimensions of oppression may behave in additive ways; the important point is that we cannot rely on or assume additivity.

The second, very closely related claim is that oppression is non-separable: the oppression experienced by a woman of colour, for example, cannot be neatly separated into the oppression she experiences as a woman and the oppression she experiences as a person of colour (Crenshaw 1989; Spelman 1988). If a Black woman is arrested on suspicion of engaging in sex work by a police officer who then sexually assaults her, does this happen ‘because she is a woman’ or ‘because she is Black’? If an Asian woman is given appalling medical care when she arrives at a hospital in the middle of what turns out to be a miscarriage, does this happen ‘because she is a woman’ or ‘because she is Asian’? The concept of intersectionality highlights the fundamentally misguided nature of questions such as these, which assume that the effects of race and gender categorization are neatly separable. It requires us instead to recognize that the oppression experienced by a Black woman, for example, cannot usually be neatly separated out into oppression experienced ‘on the basis of race’ and oppression experienced ‘on the basis of gender’. Even where there are similarities between the experiences of Black women and White women, or Black women and Black men, race and gender are very often inextricably intertwined and entangled in ways that make neat separation impossible, and attempts to perform such separation unhelpful. As with non-additivity, the point is not that oppressions can never be separated out in this way, but rather that we cannot count on their being separable in any given case. Although non-additivity and non-separability are conceptually very close – it is natural to think that it is precisely because experiences of oppression are non-additive that they cannot be separated into their component parts (Haslanger 2014, 116) – it may be worth including both points in an analysis of intersectionality, because they can be seen as cautioning us against different kinds of mistakes (Jenkins 2023): non-additivity cautions us against thinking that we can move smoothly from an analysis of single-axis oppressions to an analysis of the experience of those situated at the intersections of these axes, while non-separability cautions us against thinking we can move smoothly in the opposite direction.

The third claim, which is rather stronger than the first two, is that oppression involves involve cross-constitution or mutual constitution at the level of kinds. It is not just that race and gender kinds interact via forms of oppression that are non-additive and non-separable; rather, race plays a crucial role in constructing the reality of gender, and vice versa (Lugones 2007; Garry 2011; Carastathis 2014; Snorton 2017; Bernstein 2020; for a helpful taxonomy of different ways of elaborating this claim, see Jorba and Rodó-Zárate 2019). In other words, gender either would not or (more strongly) could not be what it is if race did not exist, and race would or could not be what it is if gender did not exist; race and gender help make each other what they are. This claim goes beyond the non-additivity and non-separability claims. Accepting those claims means thinking that racism and sexism combine in ways that exceed the sum of their parts, and therefore experiences of oppression cannot be broken down into constituent parts in which race and gender feature as separate; but one might think all of this whilst holding that there are race kinds that do not depend for their existence on gender kinds, and vice versa. To accept cross-constitution is therefore to accept a further, stronger claim in addition to non-additivity and non-separability.

The fourth claim, which is stronger again, is that intersectional kinds such as ‘Black women’ have greater explanatory power than their apparent constituent parts such as ‘Black’ and ‘woman’: we can get further with our explanations of phenomena such as oppression and domination if we use intersectional kinds such as ‘Black woman’ rather than kinds such as ‘Black’ and ‘woman’ (Bernstein 2020, 331; in its strongest form, this claim is rejected by Crenshaw 2010; for critical discussion see Jenkins 2023, 112–113).

The tools of analytic metaphysics are increasingly being explicitly applied to the concept of intersectionality. Marta Jorba and Maria Rodó-Zárate consider how, exactly, social categories should be understood in the context of intersectionality theorizing; if the intersectionality theorist is saying that two things (two social categories) are interacting, mutually constituting each other, or something similar, precisely what sort of things should we take these to be? Jorba and Rodó-Zárate argue that conceiving of social categories as if they were objects makes it difficult to uphold the claims made by intersectionality theorists, but that we fare better if we understand social categories in terms of properties (of individuals and of social systems). Based on this, they argue for an emergentist understanding of intersectionality, according to which someone’s overall experience is the result of the interaction of their various properties (their gender, their race, their class, and so on) but has distinctive features that ‘emerge’ from that interaction, such that “understanding certain behavior of single categories (gender, race, etc.) is not sufficient to capture the properties of the emergent experience” (Jorba and Rodó-Zárate 2019, 191; emergentism about intersectionality is further developed in Jorba and López de Sa forthcoming; see also the entry on Emergent Properties). Such a view, they argue, enables us to say that social categories and systems “maintain their own ontological character while allowing their effects to be in complex relations” (Jorba and Rodó-Zárate 2019, 198), giving (they contend) a plausible elaboration of the mutual constitution claim. Sara Bernstein (2020) argues that intersectionality should be understood in terms of the metaphysical and explanatory priority of the intersectional category over its constituents (for example, of the categories ‘Black woman’ and ‘Black man’ over the category ‘Black’, or the categories ‘disabled woman’ and ‘able-bodied woman’ over the category ‘woman’). Metaphysical priority means that the category ‘Black woman’ is understood to exist at a more fundamental level than the categories ‘Black’ and ‘woman’; the latter two categories depend partly on the former for their existence, but not vice versa . Following Schaffer (2010), Bernstein likens this to the priority of a circle over its semicircles. Metaphysical priority is one of a number of options for elaborating on the metaphysics involved in the cross-constitution claim, and is a rival view to Jorba and Rodó-Zárate’s emergentist account. Explanatory priority is a version of the fourth of the four claims explained above, namely that categories such as ‘Black woman’ partly explain categories such as ‘Black’ and ‘woman’, but not vice versa; as Bernstein puts it, “[t]he intuitive idea is that in understanding black womanhood, we thereby understand blackness and womanhood” (2020: 331). Bernstein argues that allocating a combination of metaphysical priority and explanatory priority to the intersectional category in comparison to its constituents provides the best metaphysical model of intersectionality (for a critical response, see Lawford-Smith and Phelan 2021). Whichever view is preferred, the application of detailed concepts and theories of analytic metaphysics to intersectionality marks an interesting development in feminist metaphysics, even though (as with most of the developments surveyed here) its interest is not confined to the field of feminist metaphysics but extends to social metaphysics more broadly.

Whilst the study of the metaphysics of intersectionality is an exciting direction that feminist metaphysics has taken in recent years, one might wonder whether the worry that Bilge raised for wider uptake of the concept of intersectionality has a corollary for metaphysics. As noted above, Bilge was worried that much of the uptake of intersectionality has stripped it of its radical politics, employing it in buttressing neoliberal and colonial projects rather than in tearing them down. Whilst it seems that most feminist metaphysicians studying intersectionality are not employing the concept in ways that support reactionary political formations, we might worry that a focus on the metaphysics of intersectionality strips the concept of intersectionality of its political content. Certainly, the abstract nature of metaphysics means that it is sometimes difficult to see what the political upshot of such discussions are. For instance, it’s far from clear what political difference it makes if we prefer a prioritarian over an emergentist view about the metaphysics of intersectionality. Now, the feminist metaphysician might protest here that their work is aimed at deepening our understanding of intersectionality, and that this deepened understanding is a) compatible with radical political claims, and b) not (always) going to have direct political upshots. Whether or not such a response is successful, this Bilge-inspired worry gestures towards a tension that all feminist metaphysicians must grapple with: how to reconcile the often abstract nature of their study with the grounded challenges of feminist praxis.

1.3 Social Structures and Social Systems

Feminist metaphysics has explored social structures and social systems in relation to sexist injustice and oppression. An influential position on this topic has been developed by Sally Haslanger across a series of related papers (2015, 2016, 2017, 2020, 2022, 2023, 2024). Haslanger argues that we should understand forms of injustice such as sexism and racism primarily in terms of “unjust and interlocking social structures” (2015, 2). At least three metaphysical questions are raised by this approach: (1) What are social structures? (2) What difference does a structural analysis make to our understanding of phenomena such as sexism? (3) What does it mean for social structures to be “interlocking”?^[12]

1.3.1. The Nature of Social Structures and Social Systems

Haslanger differentiates social social structures from social systems, and explains both by appeal to social practices. Social practices, for Haslanger, are “learned patterns of behavior that draw on social meanings to enable us to coordinate around the production, management, disposal of things of (positive or negative) value”, while social structures are “networks of social relations that are constituted through practices” (2023, 14). Social systems, finally, are collections of objects actually standing in these social relations to one another. On this view, a structure is something like a template that can be filled in in many different ways, and a system is a particular way in which that structure has in fact been filled in concretely. Social practices are the patterns of organised activity that determine both what the template is like and how it gets filled in (in particular cases).

To illustrate this, consider the social practices that organise family relations, such as the practice of treating children under a specific age (18, say) as legal minors who are under the care of certain adults, where those adults have a range of responsibilities and prerogatives relative to those children. As part of these practices, people are habituated to thinking about family relations along particular lines, and this facilitates coordination (from people both within and outside familiar) around specific ways of doing various things. For example, parents and guardians expect to be held responsible for providing care for their minor children, and schoolteachers tend not to take pupils on school trips without the consent of their parents or guardians. There is co-ordination here: typically, a schoolteacher organising a school trip knows that they need to obtain such consent, and a parent or guardian receiving a letter from the school seeking such consent will understand easily what is needed from them. Because these social practices are in place, people come to stand in social relations to one another, such as being the parent of so-and-so and being the minor child of so-and-so. The abstract form of these social relations constitutes a social structure, and whenever those relations are filled in by particular individuals, a social system exists. Accordingly, multiple distinct systems can instantiate one and the same structure, because the different individuals in those different systems stand in the same social relations to one another. For example, consider a very simple family structure formed of one parent and one child who is a legal minor. Jane (Tommy’s parent) and Tommy (Jane’s minor child) stand in this relation to one another, while Fuad (Roza’s parent) and Roza (Fuad’s minor child) also stand in this same relation to one another, forming a different family system. The structure is the one-parent-one-minor-child family, consisting of the parent-minor child relation, which exists in virtue of the relevant social practices. So here we have two systems (the Jane-and-Tommy family, and the Fuad-and-Roza family) and one structure (the one-parent-one-minor-child family).

While Haslanger theorises social structures and social systems in a closely integrated way, other philosophers have engaged with one or the other notion. Katherine Ritchie (2020), for example, offers an account of social structures that accords with the account of social structures given by Haslanger. According to Ritchie (405), social structures are “complexes, networks, or ‘latticworks’ of relations” composed of nodes and edges. A node in a structure is defined by its relations to other nodes in the structure together with any restrictions or requirements on the objects that can occupy the node, while an edge is a relation between nodes. Ritchie uses this conception of social structure to theorise two different kinds of social groups: “organized social groups”, such as a specific football team, are structured wholes while “feature social groups”, such as football fans, are nodes in a social structures.^[13] On the other hand, an account of certain sorts of social systems is given by Robin Dembroff (2024). Dembroff focuses only on the types of social systems that reproduce injustice, such as sexism: “systems of injustice” (390). They take a system of injustice to be “the historical process of reproducing an ideology” (390) through causal looping. Dembroff’s account differs from Haslanger’s account of social systems in not highlighting either practices as the building block of social systems or the link between systems and structures, but there is a shared emphasis between the two views on causal looping; i.e. the iterative and mutually responsive shaping of agents and their social environments.

1.3.2. The Explanatory Value of Social Structures and Social Systems

An important strand of investigation into social structures and social systems concerns their role in explanation. As Haslanger (2016; 2023) points out, sometimes, we are better able to explain the behaviour of some entity once we see it as incorporated within a larger system. For example, if we want to explain why Tommy moved house from London to Edinburgh in June 2024, it is extremely helpful to understand that Tommy is Jane’s minor child, that Jane moved house from London to Edinburgh in June 2024 in order to start a new job, and that there are social practices in place that condition parents to keep their minor children with them and under their care in most circumstances. In other words, we need to recognise that Tommy is part of the Jane-and-Tommy family unit, and then we can explain Tommy’s move to Edinburgh by saying that this family unit moved because of Jane’s new job. If we just tried to explain why Tommy moved house, without reference to the family unit that he is a part of, we would not get very far at all. For example, we may not be able to appeal to Tommy’s desires to explain his moving to Edinburgh, because Tommy may have wanted to stay in London since it’s where all his friends are. We can also use social structures to explain more general phenomena, such as patterns in household income distribution, by making observations such as: ‘single-parent families are more likely to experience poverty than two-parent families’ and accounting for the features of social practices that underpin these, such as the tension between the types of caregiving activities that parents are expected to undertake with respect to their minor children (collecting them from school at 3.30pm, say) and the demands of many jobs (working at least from 9am to 5pm, say).

Lauren Ross (2024) builds on this account of the role of social structures in explanations by arguing that it is more informative to think of the role of social structures in explanation in terms of ‘causal constraints’ than in terms of part-whole relations, where causal constraints are special types of causes that can condition the influence of other causal factors. As Ross puts it, a causal constraint “guides, limits, and channels the cause it interacts with” (177), as when a wire connecting a switch and a lightbulb makes it the case that pressing the switch will turn on the lightbulb. Ross agrees with Haslanger that social structures explain outcomes because they constrain and enable the behaviour of individuals. However, Ross argues that cashing this out in terms of part-whole relations does not explain why some part-whole relations are explanatory in a given case while others are not (for example, as well as being part of his family unit, Tommy is also a part of the whole that is his class at school – but this part-whole relationship doesn’t explain his move to Edinburgh in the slightest). By contrast, a causal constraint model can explain this well: to say that social structures function as causal constraints on the behaviour of individuals is to say that “[s]ocial structure imposes limitations on which options are available to individuals, while their agency performs the selection” (Ross 2024, 173). Sometimes, these limitations amount to an ‘extreme constraint’, in that it leaves an individual with only one course of action open to them, or a ‘strong constraint’, in that it makes all courses of action but one very costly or difficult. In those cases social structures play a large causal role in the relevant outcome. In other cases, the limitations are more modest, leaving open a significant number of different courses of action that are reasonably achievable, and accordingly playing a much smaller causal role in the outcome in question.

While the best way of cashing out the constraining and enabling functions of social structures is disputed, the fact that social structures and social systems do constrain and enable the actions of individuals is significant for accounts of their metaphysics. In particular, it is crucial for Haslanger’s (2023) claim that the relations that constitute social systems are not mere imagined abstractions, but rather exist in the world as parts of particular systems. For example, if Fuad were to sign Tommy’s consent form, the school would not accept it as giving permission for Tommy to go on the school trip, because Fuad is not Tommy’s parent; but Jane has the ability to give a signature for Tommy that is efficacious. The parent-minor child relation, as Haslanger puts it, “sets background conditions on and affects what forms of parental agency are possible” (2023, 6). Thus, since she claims that social structures are networks of social relations, and since relations are causally efficacious and not merely abstract or imagined, so too, in her view, are social structures.

Of course, most systems are much more complicated than the simple two-person family systems that have been discussed here. In particular, when we are thinking about social systems, we need to keep in mind that they exhibit “dynamic homeostasis” (Haslanger 2023, 8) in that they maintain themselves in a similar form over time without planning or oversight from a central authority. And we also need to remember that the individuals caught up in social systems are shaped by those systems. For example, Fuad may internalise the ideas about what it means to be a parent that are common in his society, and this may change him as a person. Perhaps he picks up on the idea that parents ought to impose routine and structure for the children, and he becomes a much more organised and rule-oriented person than he used to be before he was a parent. As Haslanger puts it, “we come to ‘fit’ niches in the structure by, among other things, internalizing the relevant norms for the positions we occupy” (2023, 9). This serves to highlight one of the ways in which social structures and social systems are taken to be extremely important for political projects such as feminism: they shape the operations of social power. (This point is accorded a prominent role in Åsa Burman’s account of social facts (2023, chapter 6)).

Importantly for feminist purposes, being differently situated within a social system makes people differentially vulnerable to one another. For example, a parent has power over their minor child that their minor child does not have over them. If the parent and child disagree, their bargaining situations are not equal, as the parent has more options than the child. A gendered example of this, discussed by Cailin O’Connor (2019), is the social norms that make women more responsible than men for the care of dependents such as children. Through filling the role of woman in a system that ties this role to responsibility for children, an individual may come to care more about promoting the welfare of (some particular) children than another individual who occupies the role of man. If those two individuals then negotiate together to decide on some joint outcome, they will be doing so from different positions, since the former will be aiming to protect the interests of the children but the latter will not, and the latter will therefore have an advantage in the negotiations (O’Connor 2019, 117). Since this inequality arises from the way the individuals are situated in a social system, it highlights the importance for feminist politics of understanding social systems and the social structures that they partake in.

1.3.3. The Individuation and Interaction of Social Structures and Social Systems

One aspect of the complexity of social structures and social systems concerns their distinctness and interdependency: when can we say we have two different social structures on our hands, rather than one more complex and extensive social structure? And when we do have two different social structures, what does it mean to say that they are “interlocking” (Haslanger 2015, 2) (or ‘interdependent’, ‘intersecting, ‘overlapping’, etc)? These questions are significant in relation to debates about intersectionality (see §2 above): arguably, an intersectional perspective directs us to attend to the interactions between social structures and systems of racism (white supremacy, white dominance...) and sexism (patriarchy, cis-hetero-masculine dominance...) and to at least take seriously the hypothesis that they do not form two distinct social systems, but are part of one larger social system.

Haslanger (2020) endorses this hypothesis, arguing that it is not useful to posit a distinct social system, ‘patriarchy’, that embeds the subordination of women into society. One consideration she offers in support of this position is that a common way to differentiate social systems from one another is by the domains of life they apply to, or the types of goods they regulate; in this spirit, we can talk of ‘the food production system’ or ‘the healthcare system’. But gendered power divisions seem pervasive across different areas of social life in a way that makes this way of individuating systems an unpromising candidate for individuating a social system of ‘patriarchy’. Another option is to see the notion of patriarchy as superceded by an account of capitalism as an over-arching social system that includes gendered divisions of power (Fraser and Jaeggi 2018). Haslanger rejects this view on the grounds that it does not adequately explain how male domination (as we know it) is produced by capitalism. Instead, Haslanger argues, we should think of the social order as “a capitalist white supremacist nationalist ableist ageist heteronormative …etc…. patriarchal order”, and “treat the mentioned elements as analytical categories that can be used to explain certain features of the system” (2020, 226). Thus, the disproportionately high rates of harassment suffered by politicians and public figures who are women of colour, for example, might be explained in terms of the white supremacist and patriarchal elements of the social order, without positing distinct social systems of white supremacy and patriarchy that are thought to exist separately from capitalism, nationalism, and so on (see also Hartmann 1981, Vogel 1983, Arruza 2016 and Wills 2018).

Robin Dembroff (2024) argues, contra Haslanger, that we should believe in the existence of a distinct social system of patriarchy, and others such as white supremacy, whilst understanding such systems to “intersect” (385) with one another. More precisely, Dembroff argues, patriarchy and white supremacy are co-constituted, meaning that they are made up of the same processes as one another, but are nevertheless aptly thought of as two different systems of injustice. If we point to where they are each being produced and reproduced, we point to the same physical things (social actors, social spaces, social activities, and so on). In this sense, patriarchy and white supremacy are inseparable, just as a statue and the lump of clay from which it is made are inseparable. Nevertheless, the ideologies of sexism and racism do different explanatory work (in the sense discussed in the previous paragraph), and have different modal properties (in the sense that it is possible that there could be a society where sexism but not racism has been eradicated, or vice versa). This is similar to the statue and the clay: the statue could be destroyed without destroying the lump of clay (by re-shaping the clay so it is no longer the same statue). In both cases, Dembroff argues, the differences justify our taking the two things—sexism and racism, or the statue and the clay—to be distinct, even though they are physically inseparable. For Dembroff, then, one set of causal processes is reproducing (at least) two distinct ideologies, gender ideology and racial ideology, and since a system of injustice is a causal process of reproducing an ideology, we have on our hands (at least) two distinct social systems (2024, 392–394). Haslanger (2024) replies to Dembroff, emphasising that the difference between their positions hinges on their differing understandings of what social systems are (outlined in 3.1) and of what ideology is (see Haslanger 2024, 418–419; Dembroff 2024, 387) and reiterating her commitment to the view outlined above.

1.4 Pregnancy

There has been lots of work both in feminist philosophy and beyond on the ethical relationship between a pregnant person and the fetus/embryo that they are carrying, especially with regards to whether the pregnant person has the right to abort that fetus/embryo, and whether being pregnant imposes any moral restrictions on the behaviour of the that person (see the entries on Pregnancy, Birth, and Medicine and Feminist Perspectives on Reproduction and the Family). There has also been work exploring the phenomenological relationship between pregnant persons and the fetuses that they carry (see e.g.,Young 1984).^[14] However, in the past ten years feminists have started to investigate the metaphysics of pregnancy.^[15] Here the key question at issue is this: What is the metaphysical relationship between a pregnant person and the fetus that they are carrying?

Simone de Beauvoir describes one metaphysical relationship that might hold between a pregnant woman and the fetus is one in which the mother is a passive container of the fetus/embryo: “snared by nature, she is plant and animal, a store-house of colloids, an incubator, an egg” (Beauvoir 1949/2011, 552 emphasis added).^[16] This metaphysics of pregnancy, whereby one organism, the pregnant animal, surrounds and contains a separate organism, the fetus/embryo, would go on to be labelled the ‘container model’ of pregnancy by Elselijn Kingma. On the container model, the relationship between a pregnant organism and the embryo/fetus they are carrying can be thought of as much like the way “a tub of yogurt is inside your refrigerator” (Smith and Brogaard 2003, 74).

The container model of pregnancy is widely assumed: de Beauvoir was describing a dominant cultural understanding of pregnancy in French society that that is shared across many other contexts, and the position has been defended by a number of contemporary philosophers (e.g., Smith and Brogaard 2003). However, as Kingma has pointed out, it is hardly the only way that we could think about the metaphysical relationship between the pregnant organism and the fetus/embryo, or as she calls them (attempting to find slightly less metaphysically committal terms) the ‘gravida’ and the ‘foster’ respectively (Kingma 2019).

Kingma argues that rather than the gravida containing the foster, the foster is instead a part of the gravida. That is, on this ‘parthood model’ of pregnancy, the relationship between a pregnant organism and the fetus/embryo that they are carrying is like that between a table and a table leg, or between a dog and its liver. Her positive argument for this view takes a couple of forms, but the broad strategy that she pursues is to argue that whatever concept of biological individuality one adopts (i.e., what makes this organism one organism and not two) one is forced to suggest that the foster is not a distinct organism from the gravida, and instead is a part of the gravida. Take, for instance, immunological tolerance. One potential way to individuate organisms is by appealing to what is (barring malfunctions) tolerated by an organism’s immune system: so an organism’s kidneys are a part of that organism, but the bacteria causing an infection in that organism are not. Kingma argues that since (at least in most cases) fosters are immunologically tolerated by gravida, this concept of biological individuality would give us the result that fosters are parts of gravida (Kingma 2019, 628–630). Or take topological continuity: here what makes an organism an individual is a physical and continuous boundary. Kingma points out that there is no way of drawing a physical boundary around the foster that does not include the gravida. She remarks, for instance, that “Just as there is a topological connection between a tail and a cat until the tail is physically severed, there is a topological connection between the [foster] and the [gravida] at the level of the umbilicus/umbilical cord, until the umbilical cord is severed after birth” (Kingma 2020a 377).

Of course, whether or not this argumentative strategy is persuasive in part depends on whether one thinks that the concepts of biological individuality surveyed by Kingma are attractive. Indeed, in later work Kingma looks at some other concepts of biological individuality which seem to favour the claim that fosters are not parts of gravida (see Kingma 2020b). If one thinks that such other other concepts are worth taking seriously, this will put pressure on Kingma’s central claim.

Regardless of whether Kingma is correct that you were a part of your (gestating) parent, she has inspired a variety of new philosophical work on the metaphysics of pregnancy. Maja Sidzinska and Anne Sophie Meincke have suggested using the tools of process ontology to account for pregnancy (Sidzinska 2017, Meincke 2022). Alexander Geddes has recently argued that the proper mereological relationship between foster and gravida is proper overlap, not parthood (Geddes 2023), and other mereological possibilities are explored by Suki Finn (Finn 2021 and 2023). Drawing on Aristotle, Hilary Yancey has argued that Kingma is right that there is a parthood relation between foster and gravida, but that she has it the wrong way round: the pregnant organism is rather a part of the embryo/fetus (Yancey 2020). Meanwhile, Chikako Takeshita has argued that pregnant organisms are best understood as holobionts, that is, symbiotic systems featuring a host organism (Takeshita 2022). Beyond the metaphysics of pregnancy narrowly conceived, Kingma and Finn have drawn on their work on the metaphysics of pregnancy to develop new distinctions around developing biotechnologies of ectogenesis (Kingma and Finn 2019), Will Morgan has presented the mammalian fetus as a problem for the philosophy of biology (Morgan forthcoming) and Sidzinska has applied the insights of this field to the history of philosophy, developing a novel challenge for Descartes by arguing that his system cannot make good sense of pregnancy without giving up on a major Cartesian philosophical commitment (Sidzinska Forthcoming).

The recent attempt to theorise the relationship between fetus and pregnant person has attempted to fill a lacuna that was long lamented by a number of feminists. In 1998, Christine Battersby, wrote that we lack “models that explain how identity might be retained whilst impregnated with otherness, and whilst other selves are generated from within the embodied self” (Battersby 1998, 18). Such a failure, suggests Battersby, leads to a failure to adequately theorise dependency and an over-emphasis on individualism. The political stakes of the metaphysics of pregnancy were also commonly referenced by feminists lamenting this failure to philosophically theorise pregnancy. Drawing on Julia Kristeva, Kelly Oliver argued that reducing women to mere fetal containers devalues women and serves to undermine their reproductive freedom (Oliver 2010, 774). Meanwhile, it is clear that de Beauvoir associated a container model of pregnancy with women’s passivity and hence their status as the second sex (Tyler 2000, 295–6). These wider political stakes have, however, somewhat fallen by the wayside in the recent feminist metaphysics of pregnancy (exceptions here include Lewis 2019 and Takeshita 2022).^[17] Open questions thus still remain about the relationship between the novel metaphysics of pregnancy and traditional ethical debates about the politics and ethics of pregnancy. One might, for instance, think that the parthood view of pregnancy, when combined with a commitment to bodily autonomy, reinforces moral arguments in favour of reproductive rights (c.f., Purdy 1990). Whether this and related arguments can be successfully made, however, is yet to be determined.

2. Feminist Metaphysical Frameworks

2.1 Relations

The first part of this entry outlined ways in which feminists have problematized the idea that particular categories are “natural”. Similarly, feminists have problematized the idea that particular categories are intrinsic or non-relational. The critical charge, stated very generally, is that dominant frameworks for representing the world, especially the social world, purport to classify things on the basis of intrinsic properties when in fact the classifications are crucially dependent on relational properties.^[18]

There are two forms of this critique, and correspondingly, two kinds of response. On the first form, the charge is that dominant frameworks misrepresent their subject matter by ignoring important relational aspects of what they purport to be talking about. For example, feminists have long charged that philosophical conceptions of the self, e.g., the conception of the independent rational self-regulator, are framed in atomistic terms, ignoring our inevitable and valuable dependence on each other. In response, feminists have urged us to recognize and revalue the complexity of subjectivity not addressed in models of rational agency. Our understanding of the self, claim such feminist metaphysicians, needs to incorporate realities of human dependence and interdependence, relationships for which women have been primarily responsible (Meyers 1997; Kittay 1999; Stoljar 2015; Willett et al. 2016).^[19]

The second form of such critique also alleges that the dominant frameworks misrepresent their subject matter by obscuring what’s relational. However, the goal is not to capture and revalue the background relations as in the first form of this critique, but to challenge them. In the cases in question, the charge is that although the system of classification appears to be sorting individuals on the basis of intrinsic properties, in fact there are invidious relations that are being masked by these appearances (Flax 1986: 199–202). Just as there are reasons why dominant frameworks construct myths about what’s natural to justify subordinating practices, likewise they construct myths about what’s intrinsic.

Take, for an example of this, Haslanger’s view of race as a social hierarchy. Lay views of race suggest that race is intrinsic: that is, there is some feature or features of individuals in themselves that makes them a member of this or that race (say, the colour of their skin). However, for Haslanger, being White is constitutively constructed by one’s subordinating relationship to Black people. That is, race is relational.^[20] For Haslanger, anti-racist critique here is going to involve both undermining the lay view of race, so as to reveal the actual social structures that govern race in society, and undermining that unjust social structure itself.

We might also read this kind of move as happening in Beauvoir’s claim that “He is the Subject; he is the Absolute. She is the Other”1949/2011, 6). Part of what is at stake in Beauvoir’s conception of women as Other is the idea that our conceptions of gender and of the self are implicitly relational, e.g., although it may seem that we can define what it is to be a woman without reference to men, in fact we cannot (Wittig 1992; MacKinnon 1989; Haslanger 1993). For Beauvoir, very roughly, women are those positioned as ‘Absolute Other’, i.e., as Other in relation to a group counting as Subject where the relation between these two groups never reverses so the Other becomes Subject (Beauvoir 1949/2011, Introduction). So, to be a woman is to stand in a complex set of social (and hierarchical) relations to men (mutatis mutandis for men). Meanwhile, to be a Subject is to stand in a complex set of social relations to some group of Others (see Bauer 2011).

These particular claims of Beauvoir’s are, of course, controversial and would need further argument to be made plausible; but the claims themselves are less important than the general idea that relations, especially social relations, are sometimes obscured by our ordinary frameworks for thinking of things. This is of special interest to feminists (and antiracists) for reasons linked to those we have for questioning the representation of a category as “natural”. Begin with a background assumption that social life cannot help but accommodate what’s “natural”. We then can contribute to some category’s appearing “natural” by supposing that the basis for membership in the category is intrinsic (thus obscuring the social relations that are the real basis for membership). In this context, pressure to change or abolish the category is (wrongly) made to seem unreasonable. The critiques raised in this section instead invite us to ask: how should we re-conceptualize the self and other parts of our social ontology? What is the relation between intrinsicness and naturalness? On what basis can we claim that one framework is “masking” another?

2.2 Dualisms

In the previous section we outlined a project of “uncovering” relations in apparently non-relational frameworks. In the sort of cases we had in mind, what’s “uncovered” are concrete social relations: e.g., relations of sexual subordination. However, Beauvoir’s claims about Subject and Other point to additional insights not yet explored.

In saying that “He is the Subject; he is the Absolute. She is the Other” (Beauvoir1949/2011, 6), part of Beauvoir’s point is that although it may appear that our distinction between subjects and non-subjects is a purely descriptive demarcation of a specific category of substances (selves), in fact, the distinction in use is normative and non-substantive. Begin with the issue of substances: one of the traditional characteristics of substances is that substances do not have opposites, i.e., there is no opposite of horse (non-horse does not count as an opposite c.f., Anonymous 2023). This is in contrast to many qualities: long/short, inside/outside, loud/quiet. One way of explicating Beauvoir’s suggestion is that once we look at the conditions for subjecthood, we see that there is an opposite to being a subject: subjects are, for example, free and autonomous persons, and the opposite of a free and autonomous person is someone unfree—in her terms, someone condemned to immanence. Moreover, it is not only the case that being a subject has an opposite, but that the opposition in question carries normative weight—so much so that the devalued side of the opposition (the Other) is denied reality in its own terms: what it is to be Other just is to be opposite to the Subject.

Again, the feminist project is one of unmasking certain ordinary assumptions about our classifications of things: the category of Subject is not—ontologically speaking—what it may seem. More specifically, categories that appear to be descriptive may in fact be functioning normatively; and categories that appear to be substantive, may in fact be functioning as one end of a qualitative spectrum. Although Beauvoir’s example has us focus on the notion of a subject or self; feminists have explored the same form of argument with other notions, notably, sex, gender, and race.

There are two significant consequences of this sort of analysis. First, with substances, it is standardly supposed that you are a member of the kind or not and there is no middle ground: you are a horse or you aren’t. Again, we can contrast this with opposites: there is a middle ground between long/short, inside/outside, loud/quiet; and some things avoid the opposition altogether, e.g., my coffee mug is neither loud nor quiet. Casting a category as substantial, then, limits the available categories for classification. For example, suppose we understand ‘male’ substantively. If males are a substance kind, then everything is either male or not-male, with no middle-ground. But if, in practice, ‘not-male’ actually functions as a way of picking out females, then it would seem that everything must be either male or female, and there can be no space for genuine categories of people who are intersex, or other-sexed, or for refusing to sex people at all. One strategy, then, for undermining the idea that a category is substantival is to highlight the multiplicity of individuals and categories “in between” the primary category and its implicit opposite. Category proliferation—the generation of a continuum or genuinely “mixed” categories—can loosen the grip of substantival assumptions (Butler 1987; Lugones 1994; Haraway 1988; Zack 1995).

Second, in the case of substance kinds, those things that are not in the kind don’t themselves form a kind of their own. They are what’s “left over”. The class of all things that are not-horses includes computers, stars, dust, basketballs, people, etc. So, if we elide ‘not man’ and ‘woman’, then women are not read as a kind. As Marilyn Frye puts it,

When woman is defined as not-man, she is cast into the infinite undifferentiated plenum…[this partly explains why] many men can so naturally speak in parallel constructions of their cars and their women, and say things like, “It’s my house, my wife, and my money, and the government can’t tell me what to do about any of it”. It also illuminates the fact that women are so easily associated with disorder, chaos, irrationality, and impurity….There are no categories in not-man; it is a buzzing booming confusion. (Frye 1996: 1000)

Frye’s strategy is not to challenge the substantive status of the man-kind by proliferation, but to challenge its hegemony in the space of persons. So, she proposes the construction of a woman-kind that is defined in its own terms, not simply by opposition to men (see Schor & Weed 1994). She argues, among other things, that this will require a recognition of real differences not only between men and women, but also among women.^[21]

Whilst work on dualisms (and to a lesser extent, relations) has somewhat fallen out of fashion in recent feminist metaphysics, there is a rich and extensive tradition of work here to be explored. We have barely scratched the surface of feminist discussion of the dualisms that guide our thinking, both in philosophy and common sense. These include mind/body, reason/emotion (Lloyd 1984; Jaggar 1989; Scheman 1993; Rooney 1993, 1994; Campbell 1998), nature/culture (Ortner 1972; Butler 1993), freedom/necessity (Mackenzie & Stoljar 2000; Hirschmann 2003; Holroyd 2011), agent/patient (Meyers 2004a,b).

Many feminist metaphysicians, especially in the ecofeminist tradition, have also been keen to point out that many of these dualisms are often culturally linked. Val Plumwood, for instance, writes that,

In the ecofeminist perspective, western thought has been characterised by a set of interrelated and mutually reinforcing dualisms that involve key concepts for understanding the social structure. Some of these can be set out as follows (the list is by no means complete).

Sphere of	Sphere of
mentality (intellect, mind, rationality, spirit)	physicality (body, nature, matter)
human	non-human, animal, nature
masculine	feminine
what is produced culturally/historically	what is produced naturally
production	reproduction
public	private
transcendence	immanence
reason	emotion

(Plumwood 1986, 131).

Plumwood suggests that this linkage is combined with the widespread cultural assumption that those spheres on the left are superior, those on the right inferior: dualisms are a form of differentiation “in which power constructs and construes difference in terms of an inferior and alien realm” (Plumwood 1993a 443).^[22] She contends that the interwoven nature of these dualisms implies that any successful feminist movement against gender hierarchy must also be ecofeminist, opposing the other dualisms in this list, not least the human/animal and cultural/natural dualisms. For more discussion see Plumwood 1993b; Lloyd 1984.

As mentioned above, this is but an introduction to the extensive feminist work on dualisms and relations. However, it does, hopefully, provide some introduction to the feminist issues that arise in thinking about classification, substances, dichotomy, and the potential political import of ontology and the prime importance of the question of value ladenness and attention to ideology in feminist theorizing (Alcoff 2011; Haslanger 2011; Janack 2011).

2.3 Metametaphysics

To some, ‘feminist metaphysics’ might appear to be an oxymoron. Metaphysics, one might think, is the apolitical, quasi-scientific study of the fundamental nature of reality: what is and what is not, carving reality at its joints. Whereas feminism, one might think, is a political movement aimed at liberation and a normative theoretical perspective on social reality. These are not obviously enterprises that can be done at the same time. Sure, one might be a feminist who campaigns for gender liberation, and a metaphysician who studies the nature of holes (see the entry on Holes) but on the above characterisations, doing a feminist version of metaphysics means working at cross purposes with oneself, at once trying to be apolitical and political, at once thinking about fundamental reality but also social reality. Indeed, some feminist theorists have argued against engaging in metaphysics precisely due to its putative apolitical status, and irrelevance to gender liberation. This critique of feminist metaphysicians by other feminists has rarely, if ever, been made in print (though it is discussed by Mikkola 2015, 781fn1, and McKitrick 2018), but it has been a longstanding point of discussion at feminist conferences in the 20th and 21st centuries.

Despite such critique, if the rich traditions of feminist metaphysics surveyed in this entry are anything to go by, many feminists have largely turned away from such worries, and are happily engaged in doing feminist metaphysics. However, the putative tension between feminism and metaphysics is not dissolved so easily. In the 2010s, a critique that started not from feminism but from mainstream metaphysics became a hot topic for discussion, centred around the following question: is feminist metaphysics really metaphysics?

If we are to get a handle on whether this question should trouble feminist metaphysicians, we should probably have a more thoroughly worked out idea of what metaphysics is. This is (part of) the domain of metametaphysics: attempting to give an account of the nature of metaphysics. Troublingly, however, the debate in metametaphysics has at certain points looked as if it would rule out feminist metaphysics entirely. Elizabeth Barnes and Mari Mikkola have argued that several prominent conceptions of metaphysics cannot easily make sense of the activities that go under the label ‘feminist metaphysics’. Mikkola writes, “This is bad news for self-proclaimed feminist metaphysicians... suggesting that we are simply confused and mistaken about what we are doing” (Mikkola 2017, 2437). According to this kind of worry, there are, broadly speaking, two aspects of feminist metaphysics that prominent accounts of metaphysics rule out from counting as metaphysics proper: their methodology and their subject matter.

The main methodological clash between feminist and so-called ‘traditional’ metaphysics is over the place of moral and political values in metaphysical theorising. In contrast to (at least the self-conception of) the neutrality of many traditional metaphysicians,^[23] feminist metaphysicians tend to build political commitments into their methodology. Most obviously, feminist metaphysics builds such commitments in at the level of question choice: which aspects of reality are to be studied is a political question, and the focus on topics such as gender, pregnancy, and intersectionality are in part of interest to feminists due to their political significance. However, feminist moral and political values can also enter into the methodology of feminist metaphysics when determining what counts as evidence for a metaphysical claim (feminist metaphysicians are often sceptical of mainstream metaphysics’ uncritical reliance on intuition given the distorting influence of ideology), and whether a metaphysical claim is justified, significant or should be endorsed (recall the discussion of ameliorative inquiry above). Mari Mikkola points out that this incursion of moral and political values into metaphysical inquiry runs against the grain of mainstream views in metametaphysics: “one might accept that feminist insights make a difference to political and moral philosophy (or to value theory), such insights appear simply irrelevant for this characterisation of metaphysics... metaphysics seems to be a paradigm value-neutral endeavor, which is prima facie incompatible with feminism’s explicitly normative stance and its emphasis on how gender makes a difference to philosophical inquiry” (Mikkola 2015, 781). Of course, strictly speaking, some values do enter into even the most apolitical forms of inquiry: ‘cognitive’ values like accuracy, consistency, fruitfulness, and simplicity guide scientific and mainstream metaphysical theory choice. However, mainstream accounts of metaphysics have for a long time suggested that there is a strong divide between moral-political values and these cognitive values, and that only the latter should guide metaphysical inquiry (c.f., Longino 1990).

The second conflict between feminist metaphysics and mainstream accounts in metametaphysics concerns their subject matter. Metaphysics, traditionally construed, concerns something like ‘ultimate reality’—the deepest and most fundamental structure of reality. Meanwhile, feminist metaphysics is largely concerned with gender and other parts of social reality, and whatever social reality is, it isn’t fundamental: it is constructed from more fundamental parts of reality (though see Bernstein 2021). Let’s look at a metametaphysical account to make this idea clearer: Jonathan Schaffer’s account of metaphysics as the study of grounding.^[24] For Schaffer, metaphysics proper is the study of ‘what grounds what’: “as Aristotle said from the start [metaphysics] is about the primary substances which provide the ground of being” (Schaffer 2009, 157). Grounding is a non-causal dependence relation that is asymmetric, irreflexive, and transitive, such that less fundamental features of the world are grounded by more fundamental features of the world. So, that a wall stands upright in virtue of the sturdiness of the bricks that make it up is a grounding relationship, as is these bricks are sturdy because of their constituent chemical structure (see the entry on Metaphysical Grounding). Metaphysics, then, studies these relationships, with a particular focus on the most fundamental grounds of reality. According to Elizabeth Barnes, this leaves questions in feminist metaphysics outside of the scope of proper metaphysical inquiry: “Which genders are there? And how many? Are there distinct genders corresponding to every gender identification or gender term? Do genderqueer, non-binary, genderfluid, androgyne, bigender, and genderfuck all exist distinct social categories?” (Barnes 2014, 343). Telling us about the fundamental grounds of being seems to leave such questions unanswered. Meanwhile, as Mikkola points out, the looping nature of some social kinds means that a grounding framework is ill-suited to thinking about many questions in feminist metaphysics (Mikkola 2015, 788–789). To take an example of the ‘loopiness’ of social kinds, does the social structure of racism ground the racist attitudes and actions of individuals, or do the attitudes and actions of individuals ground the social structure? The two relata here seem so causally and historically imbricated that it is unclear that one grounds or is ‘more fundamental’ than the other.

Can traditional accounts of metaphysics be adapted to better make sense of what feminist metaphysicians are up to? Well, it certainly looks as if there’s nothing stopping one from adopting Schaffer’s or another traditional view of what metaphysics is, and nevertheless incorporate moral-political as well as by cognitive values into one’s inquiry (Schaffer 2017, 2462–2463). Certainly, mainstream philosophy of science has shifted in recent years to widely appreciate and accept the insight from feminist philosophy of science that moral and political values can play important roles in scientific inquiry, and we might think that it is only natural that any metaphysics that sees itself as continuous with the sciences, or even just using something like a quasi-scientific method should similarly begin to take moral and political values seriously (see the entry on Feminist Philosophy of Science). Moreover, the grounding framework need not ‘privilege the fundamental’ in ways that marginalise the social world. We could, for instance, be interested in studying what grounds the existence of genders. Indeed, in his response to Mikkola and Barnes, Schaffer makes the case that ‘what grounds what’ in the social realm is of particular interest (Schaffer 2017).^[25] Schaffer’s case here has been strengthened by a number of social ontologists engaging with traditional issues in feminist metaphysics using (versions of) the grounding framework, notably Epstein 2015’s introduction of the grounding/anchoring distinction (see the entry on Social Ontology). However, it is still unclear whether this is satisfactory: take for instance the question of how many genders there are. It might turn out that the answer to this question floats free from an account of how gender is grounded. Moreover, it is unclear whether the grounding theorist can make sense of looping kinds without a serious rethinking of the nature of grounds, perhaps allowing that two things can ground one another.^[26]

Whether or not Schaffer and other mainstream metametaphysicians can successfully modify their accounts to capture what is going on in feminist metaphysics, it is worth noting that the metaphilosophical tides have changed a great deal in the short period since Mikkola wrote that it was bad news for feminist metaphysicians if their work was ruled out by mainstream accounts of metaphysics. Rather, the increased centrality of feminist philosophy to the field of philosophy, and the excellent work taking place in feminist metaphysics, mean that as Schaffer and others seem to recognise, if metametaphysicians cannot make sense of what feminist metaphysicians are doing, then so much the worse for their accounts of the nature of metaphysics (e.g., Schaffer 2017, Sider 2017). As feminists we might think that this is a rather welcome shift in disciplinary politics. Rather than thinking that our work needs to fit the definitions given to us by male metametaphysicians, we instead produce a field that does work for feminism on our own terms. On this view, there is no tension between feminism and metaphysics worth worrying about. Feminist metaphysics has shown that metaphysics should be engaged with the nonfundamental, should study looping kinds, and may include moral and political values. How best to talk about this varied practice in general terms is rather a task for metametaphysicians.^[27]

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Acknowledgments

Thanks to Elizabeth Hackett, Ann Garry, Heidi Grasswick, and the members of the Scottish Feminist Philosophy Network. Some sections of this entry are drawn from Haslanger 1992 and Jenkins 2023.