Saadya [Saadiah]

First published Thu Nov 12, 2026

[Editor’s Note: The following new entry by Gyongyi Hegedus replaces the former entry on this topic by the previous author.]

Saadya [Saadiah, Saʿadya, Saʿīd ibn Yūsuf al-Fayyūmī] was a significant and prolific Jewish thinker and polymath during the pre-Maimonidean Middle Ages. As a linguist, Biblical commentator, liturgical poet, halachic author and well-known anti-Karaite polemist, he left an indelible mark on Medieval culture.

This entry presents Saadya’s philosophical thought based on his two most famous works: The Book of Beliefs and Opinions (Arabic Kitāb al-amānāt wa’-l-iʿtiqādāt, Hebrew Ṣēfer ha-emunōt ve-ha-dēʿōt) and the Commentary on the Ṣēfer Yeẓīrah (Arabic Tafsīr kitāb al-mabādī’). The first work, Saadya’s magnum opus is written in the style of Islamic rationalist theology (kalām) and presents Judaism as a rationally justifiable system of thought, while the second work uses another style: that of the Neoplatonizing/neo-Pythagorean Ismaili Muslim authors. The two modes of expression were used consciously to address different publics. The rationalistic Book of Beliefs and Opinions was intended for the general Jewish intellectual public challenged by the Karaite innovators, as well as by the increasingly skillful arguments of Islamic theologians. The Commentary on Ṣēfer Yeẓīrah (‘The Book of Formation’) was written for a smaller group of Jewish intellectuals of a mystical inclination, who sought a deeper understanding of one of the oldest works of Kabbalah, a work that offers a deeply structured account of creation using an invisible constant commutation and re-composition of the 10 cardinal numbers and the 22 letters of the Hebrew alphabet.

The discussion below differentiates between the common use of the word ‘philosophy’ and falsafa, an Arabic technical term referring to the medieval Islamicate school of thought that closely followed the texts of the ‘philosophy of the day’, i.e. ancient Greek philosophers commented on by the Neoplatonist authors of Late Antiquity. Saadya was a brilliant thinker and philosopher in the first sense and composed the most important rationalist theological summa of Judaism. However, he did not belong to the falāsifa school, although he eventually used arguments originating from Greek sources, he never intended to consciously follow them and incorporate them into his thought.

1. Saadya’s Life and the Cultural Milieu

1.1 His Life and the Cultural Context

Saadya was born in Ḍilaẓ, village in the Fayyūm district in Egypt, probably in 882. He had already corresponded with Isaac Israeli, a Jewish Neoplatonist thinker in North Africa, before he left Egypt in 915. His departure was likely due to the extended influence of the Karaites (Jewish reformers who intended to replace the post-Biblical ‘oral tradition’ with rational argumentation). After residing in Palestine, and then Aleppo, he established himself in Iraq (Baghdad) in 922. Although he was not a member of one of the prestigious Babylonian families, his expertise in astronomy and the Hebrew calendar led to his appointment as Gaon of Sura in 928, a rank of the religious and intellectual leadership of the Diaspora. The death of the caliph, growing tensions between Saadya and the Exilarch, and changes in the power structure of the empire led to Saadya’s expulsion in 932. Debarred from office, Saadya devoted himself to scholarship during the ensuing years. It was during this period that he composed the Commentary on the Sefer Yeẓira in 931, and the Book of Beliefs and Opinions in 933. With the arrival of the new caliph in 936, Saadya was reinstated as the Gaon of Sura. He passed away in 942.

Saadya’s philosophical achievements can be understood only in the context of the vivid and fertile milieu of Iraq in the 10th century. The coexistence of a multitude of religions and philosophical ideas gave birth to two distinct attitudes: 1) The muʿtazilites and later the mutakallims (followers of the rational doctrine of kalām) were Islamic theologians supported by the Sunnite Abbasid rulers, who intended to prove by a system of rational arguments that the teachings of Islam could be perfectly understood in the light of rationality (ʿaql). In a series of public debates, during which they challenged the followers of other religions, they felt obligated to articulate their faith in the same rationalist style. Saadya’s Book of Beliefs and Opinions is a summa and a comprehensive handbook on Rabbinic Judaism, written in the rationalist style of the kalām. 2) At the same time Twelver, and Ismaili Shiites gained power and voice in the Islamic Empire from North Africa, through the Persian Gulf as far as Khurasan. An active network of Ismaili missionaries was centered in Iraq, and their philosophical tone differed immensely from that of Muslim rationalists. Inheritors of the philosophical schools of the Late Antiquity, they made Neoplatonism the theoretical basis of their religious worldview, combining Pythagorean and other elements with it. These syncretistic, eclectic ideas of the Shiite Ismailis also found their way to Saadya. While commenting on one of the oldest, most mysterious texts of the Kabbalah, the Sefer Yeẓira, Saadya had recourse to the tone of Ismaili Neoplatonism (Stroumsa 2015, pp. 77–88).

1.2 Rational Theology (Kalām)

The foundational thesis in the thought of kalām claims that the content of revelation coincides with rational thought (ʿaql). Thus, humans can follow two possible paths to know the will of the divine: a shorter way through the reading of holy scriptures (in the case of Islam the Qur’an) and a longer way through an arduous and time-consuming series of rational, dialectic investigations. The two sources of these ‘scientific’ investigations are a) a thorough observation of visible reality attainable to the perception of the senses (maḥsūs), and b) the logic implanted into the human mind by God. This rational capacity can be described as a set of statements of mathematical, logical and ethical nature, e.g. that the doubling of an amount is greater than the amount itself; that a thing cannot possess opposing accidents, i.e. a substance cannot be white and black at the same time; and that murder or stealing is/feels inappropriate. These insights are obvious and unquestionable for each sober minded adult regardless of age, religion, or ethnic background.

Making religious teachings available for everyone and harmonizing them with scientific principles was extremely useful for Islam in two ways: a) it offered an explanation of the content of Islam in simple terms and refuted other views while converting huge crowds to Islam, and b) it laid the foundations of a systematic theology. Kalamic works are handbooks composed in a dialectic style. Their polemical and dialogical nature is expressed in conventional formulas of dialogue such as “If they ask you …, then tell them…”, or “If he says…, you should answer…”. Originally, Kalām appeared as an Islamic art of religious debates however, the genre of systematic questions and answers concerning the understanding of religion on rational bases existed earlier in Syriac Christian education (Greek katekesis).

2. The Book of Beliefs and Opinions

Saadya’s Book of Beliefs and Opinions, written in Judeo-Arabic in 933 can be considered the greatest achievement in Jewish kalam. As a summa, a summary and compendium of religious doctrines, it intends to fulfill four conditions: (1) to be coherent, and all-inclusive, touching on all domains of human existence; (2) to contain statements that are proved and justified by rational argumentation; (3) to refute all views that contradict the justified ‘right’ opinion; (4) to provide adequate answers to questions and problems that emerge concerning the foundations of Judaism.

Thus, by providing an all-encompassing handbook on Judaism written in the style of Muslim rationalist theologians, Saadya waged a war on three fronts: (1) He claimed that Judaism, far from being a body of old superstitious ideas, conforms to the highest intellectual criteria. (2) He defended post-Biblical Jewish ‘Oral Tradition’ (Mishna, Talmud, etc.) against the attacks of the Karaites. (This scripturalist movement inside Judaism gained prominence in Middle Eastern Jewish communities in the 10th century. Its proponents attempted to minimize the importance of the Babylonian tradition and claimed that Jewish law should be based solely on the texts of the Hebrew Bible [mainly the Torah], and the early tradition of the Rabbis should be replaced by the rational argumentation of kalām.) As the Gaon of Sura, the intellectual head of the Jewish Diaspora, Saadya fiercely defended the Rabbinic version of Judaism and the importance of the Talmud. (3) He aimed to provide intellectual tools for any Jewish believer who is challenged by an opponent to defend himself, or who is tortured by doubts and uncertainties caused by tensions between faith and rationality. In the following eleven sub-chapters we will examine the content and structure of the eleven treatises of The Book of Beliefs and Opinions.

2.1 Introduction: The Epistemological Foundation

The human condition involves confusion and entanglement in a cacophony of perceptions, internal doubts, and uncertainties. Saadya offers a way out of this quagmire by building an epistemological structure analogous to Islamic rational theology. His first statement that “the concepts of the intellect are based on the perceptions of the senses” establishes the first duty, to check our perceptions and then to analyze and understand them. The power of the intellect (ʿaql) consists in purifying and processing the data perceived. A need for patience is the first challenge, the attempt to engage in the process of understanding is a highly time-consuming activity and many believers tend to lack the endurance needed. Understanding, similar to purifying the silver of the dross, proceeds through a gradual elimination of superfluous elements, for example, before we understand speech, we are inundated by all kinds of noises from which the intellect must gradually eliminate noises made by inanimate bodies, then sounds caused by animals, then human sounds, words, and statements, after which the intellect differentiates between impossible, possible and necessary statements, and finally, after filtering through rational analysis, true statements are accepted. According to Saadya “The praiseworthy wise man is he who makes reality his guiding principle (p. 11)”. ‘Reality’ (Arabic ḥaqīqa) means the sensible, objective reality attainable for all. This is the primary, external, objective foundation of thinking. The second (internal) basis of understanding is the intuition of the intellect (Arabic maʿqūl), which refers to “such notions as spring up solely in the mind of a human being, such as approbation of truthfulness and disapproval of mendacity” (p. 13). The activity of the intellect that eventually requires a prolonged duration is called speculation (Arabic naẓar, ijtihād). During this process the mind elaborates a theory that is in harmony with both the perception of the senses and logical necessity. Saadya uses the different appearances of the moon as an example (p. 18). After a thorough observation of the moon’s changing stages, based on the clear intuitions of our minds, we need to elaborate sciences like geometry, physics and astronomy to arrive at a true understanding that confirms both visible and logical realities.

The above-described epistemological model is borrowed from the Muslim rational theologians, and it served as a basis for inter-religious debates in the courts of the Abbasid caliphs. Unlike Aristotelian logic, the logic of the kalām proceeds on a ‘one term-based logic’ in which universal and particular statements are not differentiated. During the act of speculation, a visible ‘sign’ (Arabic dalīl, Greek semeion) is perceived by the senses and the mind then attempts to process it and define its causes. The lengthy procedure of speculation (Arabic naẓar, qiyās, istidlāl), the backbone of the logic of the kalām is a harmonization of perception and the contents of the mind.

At the end of the introductory treatise (p. 30) Saadya presents the general methodology of his book which conforms to the system of Muslim rationalists. Each treatise begins with the exposition of the correct view based on two sources: the revelation of the Bible, and the rational proofs provided by speculation. He then offers the presentation and refutation of the views that diverge from the right one. Finally, prophetic statements bearing on the subject are analyzed, and miscellaneous questions are answered. Sarah Stroumsa claims that other than the composition of accumulative numbered lists of different views, Saadya’s work is unique as he applies a “modular” construction of his lists as well. While cutting the statements of his opponents into their smallest components, he enumerates the views in such a way that the view closest to the right one is refuted first, after which the proofs and the previous refutations are re-applied against the less credible views (Stroumsa 2003, pp. 82–83).

2.2 First Treatise: Creation ex Nihilo, the Origin of Reality

In the very beginning of the first treatise, Saadya claims that “whoever ventures into it [the problem of creation] is seeking something that has never been beheld with human eyes nor been perceived by the senses”. The origin of visible reality, the source of all knowledge, is therefore outside the visible world. Revealed tradition (the Bible) claims that God brought the world into existence in a way that is unattainable for the limited human intellect. Saadya offers four rational proofs for the doctrine of creation ex nihilo borrowed from John Philoponus, a Coptic Christian theologian in the 5–6th centuries in Alexandria (Davidson 1969, 1987).

The first proof is based on the finitude of heaven and earth since the earth is situated in the center of the universe and heaven revolves around it; the second proof is derived from the composition and combination of beings out of parts that can be observed everywhere and that are signs of the handiwork of a Maker. The third proof (reformulation of the second) focuses on accidents, stating that the force that attaches visible accidents to creatures is outside of them. The fourth proof is based on the conception of time. If time was endless, the present would not be able to exist since the actual moment would not have been able to traverse infinity (The Book of Beliefs and Opinions, pp. 32–37).

The eclectic nature of Saadya’s thought and that of kalām in general is evident here. He uses pre-existing philosophical material without hesitation and without mentioning the name of the author. Of course, we cannot know whether Saadya read these proofs or heard about them in conversations.

After proving by the above-described rational arguments that all things were created in time, and by someone else out of nothing, Saadya engages in lengthy refutation of twelve views differing from that of the creation ex nihilo. They are as follows: (1) “The bodies had a Creator, who had at His disposal eternal spiritual beings.” The Platonist creation theory is refuted by showing the impossibility of the co-eternity of any substance together with the Creator. (2) “The Creator of the bodies had created them out of His own substance.” According to one of Saadya’s several objections, it is impossible that the infinite Creator forced Himself into finite bodies full of imperfections. (3) “The theory of him who combines the two previously described hypotheses.” The proponent of this theory is refuted by all the counterarguments referring to the two previous theories. (4) “The opinion of the dualists who claim that two eternal creators coexist: one good and another evil.” In the lengthy refutation against this pre-Islamic Iranian view, Saadya applies the analogy of ‘light and darkness’ to prove that darkness is not a principle opposed to that of light, but merely the absence of light (p. 53). (5) “The view of those who profess as the origin of all things the four natural qualities.” This theory, which claims that all bodies are composed of earth, water, air, and fire, and was traditionally attributed to the presocratic Empedocles, is challenged by two questions: What power keeps these four elements separated? and How are they united? (6) “Those who profess as the origin of things the four elements of nature and matter (hyle).” Again, Saadya asks the question, What kind of power separated and connected these ingredients and in what manner? (7) “That of him who asserts that the heavens, consisting of a fifth element, are the makers of the bodies.” This view is refuted, among other counterarguments, by the observation that heaven is in constant motion and contains a gradation of spheres. (8) “That of ‘chance’, i.e., that the heavens and the earth came into being by chance without premeditation on the part of a planning mind or agent.” Saadya claims that the very existence of the notion of ‘nature’, which presupposes constancy of laws annihilates this thesis. (9) “‘The doctrine of eternity’ that claims that things have always been in existence, having neither beginning nor end.” In this case, Saadya argues that the proponents of this doctrine rely exclusively on the perception of their senses and since they have always seen this world in existence, they think that it has always been so. However, they forget about the other two sources of cognition: the insight of the intellect (Arabic maʿqūl) and logical necessity/speculation (Arabic naẓar, ilzām) as mentioned in the epistemological introduction.

The final three theories are the most faulty, since their proponents commit serious transgressions by ignoring the correct epistemological procedures that should precede logical investigation: (10) “The theory of the Sophists, who regard all creatures both eternal and created, because, according to them, the reality of things depends solely on opinions concerning them” (11) “The theory of skepticism, the theory of those who maintain that it is proper for man to refrain from believing anything, because they claim that human reasoning is full of uncertainties” and (12) “Those who feign complete ignorance and reject both the teachings of science and the observation of the senses.”

Thus, Saadya claims that with logical means the doctrine of the creation ex nihilo can be proved, however, there is no way whereby a mere creature can conceive of such an event.

2.3 Second Treatise: Who is Behind Creation? The Ultimate Unity and Incorporeality of God

This treatise is built on the previous one by focusing on the power that has the capacity to perform creation ex nihilo. It is introduced by a short epistemological prelude claiming that while we perform logical investigation/speculation in the kalamic sense, we can expect a gradual refinement of the notion we seek. Human knowledge is finite and when we start the lengthy process of logical search, we begin with sense perception that gathers material evidence, the mind then contemplates more and more abstract and subtle concepts, thus, when we arrive at the terminal point of our research – the notion of God – the physical nature of the created world has no more actuality and we have to claim that the highest, most refined and immaterial notion that our intellect might attain is God, who is the agent behind creation. Again, in the same way that we can prove creation ex nihilo, we can prove the existence and the incorporeality of God; however, our mind is incapable of formulating an exact and detailed description of God since “what is finite and endless cannot be embraced by the human mind” (p. 78). “Furthermore, the realization of creation ex nihilo is needed for the recognition of the Creator, since there is no means of proving the existence of a Creator other than that of creation.” (p. 81).

In what follows, Saadya claims the ultimate unity, or, rather the ‘innumerability’ of God, thereby refuting the Dualists, who state the existence of two gods, and the Christians, who believe in the triune nature of God. Saadya’s main argument is that numbers are accidents that refer to material creatures, thus they do not have any validity referring to non-corporeal existence. Also, the fault of Christians consists in assuming that “God’s vitality and omniscience are distinct from His essence” (p. 87). Here, Saadya formulates a crucial idea of Islamic and Jewish rational theology claiming that God cannot have accidents in the same way creatures do and it is impossible for our mind to analyze and attach numbers to the highly lofty notion of the Creator.

At the end of the treatise, Saadya explains the meaning of diverse Biblical passages that refer to God in corporeal terms. He argues that all the terms of the holy scriptures that attribute human characteristics to God should be understood in a figurative sense, since the human mind is incapable of producing an exact description of God. Finally, to establish a solid philosophical foundation for the impossibility of describing God within the categories of the human mind, Saadya presents by ‘via negativa’ the inability of human thought to conceptualize the Creator. He systematically moves through the Ten Aristotelian categories, and without mentioning his direct source or the name of Aristotle, he proves one by one that the notion of Creator is beyond all these categories: (1) Since “all existing beings can be divided into five principal groups: minerals, vegetables, animals, astral bodies, and angels”, it can be proven that the Creator is none of those, thus God is not a substance (p. 91). The same can be stated about (2) quantity, (3) quality, (4) relation, (5) place, (6) time, (7) possession, (8) position, (9) action, and (10) passivity, since all these terms are attributed to creatures and to their places in the work of creation, but the Creator of time and space and all matter and possibilities is above them. Thus, anthropomorphisms in Biblical texts should be taken as a gesture of revelation to bring the ultimately subtle concept of God closer to limited human understanding.

The lengthy process of speculation proceeding towards an increasingly subtle concept refines the human soul as well. After a person has gone through the long process of speculation and understands the right meaning of the Biblical passages, “his soul believes it as true and it is mingled with his spirit and becomes an inmate of his innermost recesses” (p. 108). This passage bordering on mysticism is completely alien to the style of rational theologians. However, the subtlety of the topic may have induced the author to express his idea in a poetic tone.

2.4 Third Treatise: What We Owe to God: Commands and Prohibitions

This treatise offers the rational understanding of the following crucial theological principles: (1) the logical necessity for divine commands and prohibitions, (2) the division of commandments to ‘rational’ and ‘revealed’, (3) the necessity for ‘authentic tradition’, and (4) the permanence and non-abrogation of Jewish laws based on divine commands and prohibitions.

As mentioned in the introductory treatise, humans are hopelessly lost in an ocean of doubt and uncertainty, thus they are in need of divine guidance. Furthermore, Saadya claims that “God endowed humans with the means whereby they might attain complete happiness and perfect bliss” (p. 112); it is through the efforts to understand and fulfill these decrees that human life is made perfect. The rational basis of the Biblical commandments is implanted into the human mind and can be traced back to the following four principles: (1) Whoever does something good should be compensated for it; (2) Creatures should serve and thank the Creator for bringing them into existence; (3) For the same reason, the Creator cannot be treated with contempt or insulted; (4) Creatures should be prevented from harming each other. All the laws of Judaism originate from these basic insights instilled in our minds (pp. 113–115).

While focusing on the immense corpus of the laws of Judaism, Saadya introduces the division between ‘rational’ and ‘revealed’ laws, i.e. between laws that are evident to the mind and laws that do not seem to have a rational basis. For example, the law according to which you must show reverence to your father in return for having raised you is rational, while the laws concerning the cleanliness and uncleanliness of food often lack logical explanations. Non-rational laws may be revealed to urge us to speculate; we may be able to discover a logical basis in the future.

Logical necessity also dictates that the precepts of the Bible be refined by authentic prophecy and tradition. Prophets should fulfill certain criteria for showing the divine origin of their messages: divine signs and miracles should be publicly displayed, and their messages cannot contradict the Bible or earlier prophetic messages. Authentic tradition that transmits and interprets the words of the prophets is also necessitated by logic to protect revelations from false impressions and deliberate misrepresentations (p. 127). Here, Saadya offers the rational justification for Jewish post-Biblical compositions, such as the Mishna and the Babylonian Talmud. As the Gaon of Sura, the intellectual leader of the Diaspora, he made the ‘oral tradition’ a natural continuation of the holy scriptures, and, unlike the Karaite scripturalists, strictly condemned replacing the Babylonian oral tradition with a direct rational analysis of the Hebrew Bible.

The last part of the treatise touches upon the question of the ‘abrogation of Mosaic law’, i.e. it answers the challenge claiming that Jewish law can be replaced by other (Christian or Islamic) systems. In his response, Saadya refutes his opponents based on Scripture, claiming that according to the Bible (Jer. 31: 35,36) the Jewish nation is destined to exist as long as heaven and earth exist, and that means the non-abrogation of the Jewish legal system since the Jews are a nation only by virtue of their laws. The other rational argument holds that Jewish laws, which are ultimately derived from logical speculations, necessitate their own existence as long as rationality continues to exist as a guiding principle.

2.5 Fourth Treatise: Concerning Obedience and Rebellion, Predestination and Divine Justice

The first part of this chapter focuses on a declaration that human beings are the center and the most precious part of the universe based on the fact that they are the only creatures endowed with rational faculty. And although man’s body is of small dimension, his soul is more extensive than heaven and earth because his knowledge embraces all that they [heaven and earth] contain (p. 148). The second, more substantial part of this chapter touches upon the justification of human free will. “Man cannot be considered as the agent of an act unless he exercises freedom of choice in performing it, for no one can be accountable for an act who does not possess freedom of choice and does not exercise this choice” (p. 151–152). Both man-made legal systems and God’s punishment or reward in the afterlife (described in detail in the ninth treatise) lose their meaning if we negate the validity of the freedom of will. Furthermore, this validity can be proven even at the most fundamental level of human cognition, the perception of the senses. Saadya claims “I find that a human being feels conscious of his own ability either to speak or remain silent, or to take hold of things or desist from them…” (p. 152). This assertion of free will does not contradict the omniscience of the Divine and His foreknowledge of all events, since His knowledge is beyond time and does not operate as the cause of human acts. Here, Saadya echoes the views of early Islamic rationalist (muʿtazilite) theologians who made free will a cornerstone of their system.

2.6 Fifth Treatise: The Classification of Human Acts: Merits and Demerits

After establishing the concept of free will, Saadya offers a classification of human acts. God, as an “expert numismatist” who can differentiate between diverse acts and intentions, keeps a record for future compensation. Based on the Biblical text, human behavior can be divided into ten sub-categories according to merits and demerits: pious and impious, obedient and disobedient, perfect and imperfect, sinful and corrupt, renegade and penitent. The existence of a realm in which recompensation according to divine justice will occur is justified by the fact that innocent children are made to suffer pain, and the godless in this world are not deprived of well-being (p. 173).

In the second part of the treatise, after a rich exposition of the gradation of merits and demerits, Saadya provides three important observations concerning responsibility: (1) the higher the rank of human beings, the greater the value of their obedience; (2) the greater the multitude of those that have been wronged, the more serious the crime; and (3) one cannot be punished for his intention or inner conviction except for denying the existence of God, since that is a conclusion reached only by the mind (pp. 184–185).

It is at the end of this chapter that Saadya outlines his method of scriptural interpretation. He asserts, in the style used by Islamic rationalists, that scripture needs to be understood literally. Allegorical interpretation (majāz) is allowed for four reasons: (1) in order to harmonize the verse with the evidence of the senses; or (2) with the testimony of reason; or (3) with other Biblical passages; or (4) with tradition. In the absence of these criteria metaphorical understanding is considered as heresy. At this point, the well-organized structure of Saadya’s book becomes evident: the laws of Biblical interpretation must conform to the same rules as the process of human cognition, in general, as outlined in the epistemological introduction.

2.7 Sixth Treatise: About the Soul, the Most Perfect creature of God, and about Death as the Separation of Soul and Body

This treatise is similar to the first treatise (concerning the creation ex nihilo) and the second treatise (about God) in the sense that we are dealing with an ultimately sublime and lofty, immaterial substance concerning which incorrect views are extant. Saadya refutes six opinions before offering his own definition: (1) The idea that the soul is an accident is refuted by the argument that the immense wisdom contained by the soul cannot originate from an accident. (2) The soul is air. (3) The soul is fire. Since these are building blocks of the material world, they cannot serve as the basis of the soul. (4) The soul is composed of an uncreated intellectual part residing in the heart and of a created vital power in the other parts of the body. However, it is unclear how these two can mingle in the same person. (5) The soul is composed of two kinds of air, internal and external. This view can be explained by the process of breathing; however, the inhalation of air occurs not to keep the soul alive but to regulate body temperature. (6) The soul is pure blood according to the Biblical view. In Saadya’s view this claim is metaphorical, since the language of the Bible tends to name sublime concepts based on their location; wisdom is called heart, for example, since it resides there (p. 191).

Saadya shifts to a philosophical tone when he offers his own definition: “As for the quality of its substance, it is comparable in purity to that of the heavenly spheres. Like the latter, it attains luminosity as a result of the light which it receives from God, except that its substance becomes, in consequence thereof, even finer than that of the spheres” (p. 193). It appears that when Saadya, a fervent rationalist, grapples with hyper-rational ideas, such as the creation ex nihilo or the substance of the soul, he relies on a philosophical (Neoplatonist) terminology.

After this claim, the following problem arises: why did God place this ultimately simple and sublime immaterial substance into the turbid material body? Saadya answers this question by claiming that body and soul should be conjoined during the lifetime of a person, given that the soul by itself is unable to perform any act in the material world. Thus, the soul and the body constitute one agent and will also be punished and rewarded together in the afterlife. In death, after a measure of time during which the vitality of the body fades, the two substances separate. The soul is then stored until God has created all the souls He intends to create, at which point existence as we know it ends. A new creation begins, i.e. resurrection (explained in treatise 7) during which souls are reunited with the bodies they had during their lifetimes.

In the final part of the treatise Saadya refutes the views concerning metempsychosis (reincarnation), claiming that this is the incorrect opinion of the dualists and spiritualists.

2.8 Seventh Treatise: Concerning the Resurrection of the Dead in this World

Treatises 7, 8, and 9 focus on future events: resurrection, redemption, and reward and punishment in the afterlife. These events cannot be supported by the perception of the senses, since they are supposed to happen in the future. Thus, the only way rational theology can deal with them is by analogy: resurrection is viewed as a ‘second creation’, redemption is a repetition of ‘the exodus from Egypt’, and recompensation in the afterlife is prefigured by reward and punishment in this world. These chapters contain lengthy exegetical parts in which Saadya attempts to reconcile the Biblical text with rational theology.

According to Saadya, resurrection can be conceived as a replica of the creation ex nihilo at the end of time. Divine justice necessitates that all human agents be judged according to their deeds. And since body and soul perform all their acts together, reward and punishment should touch both. The concept of resurrection is far from being synonymous with the notion of redemption, which means the end of history and a revival of a Jewish government and the restoration of the Jewish nation. The second part of the treatise expands on the interpretation of Biblical and Talmudic passages that refer to resurrection. Saadya abstains from offering a response to concrete questions about resurrection given the similarity of this event to the creation ex nihilo: the re-creation of the dead at the end of time, like the creation ex nihilo, cannot be understood and represented by the human mind.

2.9 Eight Treatise: Redemption, the End of History

The ‘exodus from Egypt,’ under the leadership of Moses and post-Biblical tradition serve as the textual bases for building two scenarios that Saadya envisions for the end of history: (1) If repentance falls short, i.e. if the Jews transgress Biblical commandments, history will proceed until the end is fulfilled, i.e., until the time of the resurrection. According to this scenario, the end of history will be marked by catastrophes, famine, war, and pestilence, and before the time of resurrection the “Messiah descended from Joseph” will appear to herald the coming of the “Messiah descended from David”. (2) If the people of Israel repent and obey God, the Messiah descended from David will appear unheralded and introduces a peaceful golden age. This implies the return of all Israelites to the Promised Land and the restoration of the Temple of Solomon in Jerusalem. All diseases and hardships will disappear, the light of God’s Presence will appear, and the gift of prophecy will be widespread. In the end of the chapter Saadya refutes the view according to which this Messianistic period refers to the time of the Second Temple.

2.10 Ninth Treatise: Reward and Punishment in the World to Come

The logical necessity of the ‘world to come’ is supported by two observations: we see the godless often prospering in this world, which contradicts to divine justice, and good and bad events are hopelessly intertwined in the material world. According to Saadya “all well-being in this mundane world is bound up with misfortune, and all happiness with hardship, and all pleasure with pain, and all joy with sorrow” (pp. 256–57). This, as well as Biblical and prophetic tradition requires the creation of a new world in the future. As established in the seventh treatise, this new world will be of a material nature, since body and soul cooperate in action. The double nature of the sun that on the one hand radiates luminous brightness, and, on the other hand burning heat serves as an analogy for reward and punishment: good people will enjoy everlasting pleasure in the sight of luminosity, while evil people will experience the burning heat. Although the ‘world to come’ cannot be described precisely, since it is not yet created, Saadya supposes by logical necessity that the nature of time, food, drink and matter in general will be different there: eternal and uncorruptible. Rationality also requires that people be punished and rewarded in proportion to their deeds, thus, God will create seven subdivisions for both Paradise and Hell.

2.11 Tenth Treatise: Concerning How It is Most Proper for Man to Conduct Himself in this World – the Middle Way

In the same way that all creatures are composite in nature, the human soul is endowed with multiple inclinations. According to Saadya’s ethics, rationality should define the limits of pursuing them. The final treatise of the book consists of the rational analysis of thirteen aims to which men dedicate themselves. All of these are good, but if taken to extremes they become harmful addictions. Ideal human conduct involves a harmonious composition of the elements that follow: (1) abstinence: a noble idea to recognize the transitory nature of material life, but one cannot completely neglect the world; (2) eating and drinking: necessary for survival, however one cannot subordinate all other activities to them; (3) sexual intercourse: desirable to produce offspring within the boundaries of marriage; (4) eroticism: should be experienced only between husband and wife; (5) accumulation of money: necessary for survival but not the exclusive aim; (6) children: desirable as long as one can provide an appropriate upbringing for them; (7) habitation of the world: a noble goal, but if excessive, increases worries about taxation, unforeseen conditions, etc.; (8) longevity: a natural human desire, but one cannot forget that life serves only as a stepladder to the world to come; (9) dominion: necessary to attain a rank, but if it becomes the exclusive target, it creates envy and an overestimation of one’s worth; (10) revenge: although one enjoys the discomfort of an enemy, one should know when to accept intercession or act with compassion; (11) knowledge: a noble human endeavor, but one cannot forget about sustenance, shelter, clothing, etc.; (12) worship: although necessary, one cannot give up other inclinations for making service to the Divine, the care of future generations is also important; (13) rest: the relaxation of the mind and body is desirable, however, abandoning other activities leads to poverty and various diseases.

At the end of his magnum opus, Saadya asks the following question: “Seest thou not, in such matters as things seen and heard and food and drink, much better results are achieved with the help of the concentration of mind than without it?” (p. 320) This “concentration of the mind” refers to a universal, rational metalanguage that is implanted into the minds of all sane, sober, adult humans.

The following section will present an entirely different approach in Saadya’s philosophy.

3. Saadya’s Commentary on the Sefer Yeẓira

In 931, more or less simultaneously with The Book of Beliefs and Opinions, Saadya composed a commentary on the Sefer Yeẓira ‘Book of Formation’. Surprisingly, its philosophical tone appears to be radically different from that of kalām ‘rational theology’. In his commentary, in accordance with the mystical tone of the Sefer Yeẓira, Saadya shifts to a Neoplatonist style, wherein a timeless, ultimate reality is represented.

3.1 The Sefer Yeẓira

The Book of Formation/Creation is considered to be the earliest extant Hebrew text of systematic speculative thought. Although it consists of no more than 1600 words, its solemn and enigmatic style makes it one of the foundational texts of Jewish mysticism. Suggested dating for its composition varies from as early as the first century C. E. to as late as the early Muslim Period (Stroumsa 2015, p. 74).

At the heart of the Book of Creation lies a compact discourse on cosmology and cosmogony. It opens with the declaration that God created the world by means of 32 “secret paths of wisdom”. These are the ten numbers (ṣefirot) and the twenty-two letters of the Hebrew alphabet. The first four sefirot emanated from each other, the first emanation being “the spirit of the Living God” (ruaḥ elohim ḥayyim). The universe resulted from the twenty-two letters that God engraved (ḥaqaq) on a first ether-like element called the ‘primal air’. All the beings in the three strata of cosmos, i.e. in the world, in time and in man’s body, came into existence through the interconnection of the twenty-two letters. According to the author of the Book of Creation, the twenty-two letters are divided into three groups: (1) the three matrices (immot): alef, mem, and sin, which represent the three basic elements, the three seasons, and the three parts of the human body. (2) seven ‘double letters’ (they can be pronounced in a harder or a softer way in Hebrew), through the medium of which the seven planets, the seven heavens, the seven days of the week, and the seven orifices of the human body were created; (3) the twelve remaining simple letters (peshutot) correspond to the twelve signs of the zodiac, the twelve months of the year, and the twelve principal organs and limbs of the human body.

3.2 Saadya’s Commentary on the Sefer Yeẓira

Saadya’s commentary can be considered a the “re-creation” and “re-invention” of the text in Arabic (Hughes 2010, pp. 71–72). He translates the text first and then divides it into eight chapters and comments on each of them as follows:

Chapter 1. Philosophy is described as analogous to the acts of the Creator. Philosophy, like “remote wisdom” is unattainable through the perception of the senses, while “wisdom close to the understanding” is based on experience. In this frame of mind, he poses the following question: What is the first element from which all things were created? After refuting eight views, the ninth correct view is presented: creation ex nihilo. Although the precise understanding of creation is unattainable for the senses, the text of the Sefer Yeẓira offers the most appropriate analogy: the system of letters and numbers.

Saadya claims that the Sefer Yeẓira is based on the illuminative vision of Abraham the patriarch. After a sudden flash of insight into the creative activity of God present in His creation, Abraham describes it as a constant “dance” of letters and numbers.

Chapter 2. The wisdom (ḥikma) behind the vision of Abraham is timeless, the result of a sudden illuminative moment. It displays a deeper reality and claims that the sensible differences in the visible world originate from the changes in the proportionalities and combinations of invisible constituents. God, the Creator is immanent in His creation in the same way that the number “one” indwells and underlies the entire numeric system.

Chapter 3. The number “one” serves as the basis of the multiplication of numbers and the resulting exponential increase. It lays behind the infinite variability of numbers that is analogous to the constant change of accidents in the visible world. Number “one” has different meanings: it may refer to external unity in the visible realm (one as opposed to many), but it may also refer the original internal unity in the mind prior to any experience of multiplicity.

Chapter 4. Various combinations of letters are presented. The notion of the ‘first air’ (al-hawa’ al-awwal) is introduced as the first creature of God and the medium through which God underlies and indwells creation. As a basis and ‘place’ of all existence, it is equal to the Biblical terms ‘Spirit of Holiness’ (rūḥ al-quds) and ‘the Created Glory of God’ (kabōd nibrā). Thus, all visible changes originate from the different combinations of their invisible elements “inscribed” by God on the medium of the ‘first air’.

Chapters 4–8. General rules and individual examples of the combination of letters and their manifestation in the visible world are outlined.

3.3 “Abrahamic” Philosophy?

After The Book of Beliefs and Opinions, the tone of Saadya’s Commentary on the Sefer Yeẓira comes as a complete surprise. Instead of systematically constructing an epistemological structure based on logic and the perception of the senses, Saadya unfolds an illuminative vision about the invisible foundation of visible reality. The text of the Sefer Yeẓira is treated as ancient, sublime and exquisite, originating from Abraham the patriarch himself, thus older than the Bible. Saadya claims that it responds to a philosophical question about the nature of the first element out of which God created the universe. Here, in the very beginning of his commentary, Saadya achieves two aims: (1) he categorizes the Sefer Yeẓira as a work of philosophy that is “similar to the activity of the Creator” (p. 4), thereby justifying a commentary that is written in a Neoplatonist style entirely different from that of the rational theologians; and (2) he elaborates a Gnosticizing, Neoplatonist style of speculation based on the Biblical juxtaposition of easily attainable (qerobhah) and remote (reḥoqah) wisdom (Eccl. 7:23).

Thus, Saadya’s thought is two-layered: for the justification of the creation ex nihilo and the existence of God he applies the exoteric, universally available methods of rational theology, while for the allegorical representation of how creation happened, he relies on an esoteric, neo-Platonizing, neo-Pythagorean tone. These two “streams” of though, rational and intuitive, respond to different needs and lead, eventually, to different outcomes. From a rationalist approach based on the perception of the senses available for all, the fact of creation ex nihilo and the divine power behind it can be proven but not understood. The sudden, illuminative knowledge gained by Abraham and explained in a Neoplatonist style fills this gap by offering an allegorical representation for the ‘how’ aspect of creation through the system of numbers and letters. While rational thought is unable to offer a description of God, this timeless insight into the invisible sources of sensible reality posits God as naturally ‘omnipresent’, the ultimate basis and foundation of all existence.

3.4 The Context of Saadya’s Commentary on the Sefer Yeẓira

Both the ‘easy’ (rationalist) and ‘remote’ (Neoplatonist) tones used by Saadya are deeply embedded in the Muslim context in which he lived. His Book of Beliefs and Opinions is a masterpiece of kalām, the art of rationalist or dialectic theology practiced by Muslim authors in the 10th century. By applying their epistemological framework and style of argumentation Saadya attempted to prove that Judaism in its rabbinic version could be successfully defended by logical arguments. The Commentary on the Sefer Yeẓira responds to a different challenge. In addition to this attempt “to detach the work from mythical, mystical, and magical elements which had possibly been attached to it by earlier commentators” (Ben-Shammai 1987), Saadya intended to respond to another challenge. Sarah Stroumsa calls the 10th century “the Shiite intermezzo”. In the heart of the Islamic world Shiite tendencies became more visible: “While Twelver Shiites replaced Sunnites in Aleppo, Ismaili Shiites ruled in the region of the Persian Gulf and spread to Khurasan. The Ismaili Fātimids had already consolidated their caliphate in North-Africa and were poised to proceed to the conquest of Egypt, Saadya’s birthplace. Ismailis made Neo-Platonism the theoretical basis of their religious worldview, combining Pythagorean and other elements with it” (Stroumsa, 2015, pp. 77–78). Thus, in Saadya’s time the strongest proponents of philosophy were not the Aristotelian falāsifa but, rather, the Neo-Platonist philosophers; in his Commentary, Saadya tapped into a system inherited in the Islamicate world from Late Antiquity. (Stroumsa 2015, p. 89).

Thus, in his groundbreaking works Saadya integrated two dominant voices of the Islamicate world: to prove the validity of Judaism in a rational way, he recurs to the method of Muslim rationalists (mutakallims), while to describe the how aspect of creation ex nihilo, which is unattainable by logic based on sense perception, he used the philosophical tools of Neoplatonizing thought. Letter-mysticism, present in compositions like the Epistles of the Pure Brethren (Rasā’il Ikhwān aṣ-Ṣafaā’), was certainly available to him through the network of Ismaili missionaries present in Iraq.

Saadya Gaon, the most significant Jewish thinker of the eastern part of the Islamic Empire successfully expressed the thought of Judaism via two channels: He used the logical-scientific frames of Muslim rationalists to justify the validity of Judaism, and successfully applied the Neoplatonic, Neo-Pythagorean style of his time to address the mystical layers beyond logic. Until the “Aristotelian turn” introduced by Moses Maimonides Saadya remained the definitive voice in Jewish thought.

4. Saadya’s Commentaries on the Bible

Saadya Gaon’s translation and commentaries on most of the books of the Hebrew Bible made the Judeo-Arabic language an accepted way to treat religious issues. His translation was also received as a standard version of the Bible in Arabic speaking Rabbanite communities. According to Miriam Goldstein (2009, 174–175) three factors motivated Sa֒adya to create his Tafsīr (commentary). First, an obvious shaper of Sa֒adya’s translation was the threat presented by the fast-growing Karaite movement and its prolific scholars, as well as by other individuals and movements opposed to the geonic monopoly on authority within the Jewish community. A second motivating factor was the pressure of an increasingly Arabicized and cosmopolitan Jewish community, familiar with the latest trends in Arabic theology and philosophy, while also becoming less attentive to traditional Jewish sources. Thirdly, Sa֒adya’s own dissatisfaction with existing translations; he wanted to provide an authoritative translation which would prevent amateurs from creating perfunctory translations.

Thus, Saadya’s commentaries, in the same way as his kalamic works reacted to the challenges of his time, can be situated in a rich context of Christian, Islamic and Jewish works. Translation into Arabic for Saadya meant much more than the mere transfer of the text into another language. It was always the first step of his commentaries, for he made the text speak in the language used by the Jewish population of the Islamic Empire. As a next step, he delved into the linguistic and philological particularities of the Hebrew or Aramaic text and, finally, he made observations of legal and ethical nature. The style of the commentary and its association with other sources were always defined by the basic tone of the Biblical book commented on, for example, the legal parts of the Torah called for the contextualization of Biblical texts within the framework of Rabbinic exegesis, whereas the apocalyptic statements of the Book of Daniel required a more metaphorical approach.

Parts of Saadya’s commentaries exist in fragments or in unpublished form, however some of his translations and commentaries were published: Commentary on the Book of Genesis (by M. Zucker 1959 in Hebrew and 1984 in English), The Book of Psalms (1966), The Book of Job (1973), and The Book of Daniel (1981) published by Y. Qafih (in Hebrew), and The Book of Isaiah published by Ratzaby (1993). Saadya’s commentary on Job containing ethical observations was translated, edited, and published in English by L. E. Goodman (1981).

Haggai Ben-Shammai composed several studies on Saadya’s commentaries both on a micro-philological (2006) and on a general, bibliographical (2015) level. Saadya’s exegetical methods outlined in the introductions of his commentaries were analyzed by Sarah Stroumsa (2007).

In recent scholarship Almuth Lehman (2021) focused on the notion of the ‘Rising One’ (al-nāhiḍ) in Saadya’s ethics and she attempted to understand it in (Neo-Platonized) Aristotelian terms as the subject actualizing ethical potentiality through the awakening of the soul.

Bibliography

Primary Literature

  • Saadya Gaon, The Book of Beliefs and Opinions, S. Rosenblatt (ed. and tr.), New Haven: Yale University Press, 1948.
  • Saʿadya ben Yosef Fayyūmī, Sefer Yeṣira [Kitāb al-mabādi’] ʿim perūsh ha Ga’on, Y. Qāfiḥ (ed.), Jerusalem: Ha-Va’ad le-Hotsa’at Sifrei Rasag (The Committee for the Publication of the Books of Saadia Gaon), 1972.
  • Saadya Gaon, Kitāb al-amānāt wa-‘l-iʿtiqādāt, The Book of Beliefs and Opinions, Y. Qafih, (ed. and tr.), Kiryat Ono: Makhon Mishnat ha-Rambam, 1970.
  • Saadya Gaon, Tehilim ʿim targum we-perush (Translation and Commentary on the Book of Psalms), Y. Qafih (ed. and tr.), Kiryat Ono: Makhon Mishnat ha-Rambam, 1966.
  • Saadya Gaon, Kitāb al-taʿdīl, (The Book of Theodicy, Commentary on the Book of Job), Y. Qafih (ed. and tr.), Kiryat Ono: Makhon Mishnat ha-Rambam, 1973.
  • Saadya Gaon, Daniel ʿim targum we-perush (Translation and Commentary on the Book of Daniel), Y. Qafih (ed. and tr.), Kiryat Ono, Makhon Mishnat ha-Rambam, 1981.
  • Saadya Gaon, Tafsīr Yeshʿayah, Kitāb al istiṣlâḥ (Translation and Commentary on the Book of Isaiah), Y. Ratzaby, (ed. and tr.), Kiryat Ono: Makhon Mishnat ha-Rambam, 1993.
  • Saadya Gaon, Tafsīr kitab al-mabādī (Commentaire sur le Sefer Yesira ou livre de la creation, M. Lambert, (ed. and tr.), Paris: Emile Bouillon (ed), 1891.

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  • –––, 2010, “Sharing Secrets: Inter-Confessional Philosophy as Dialogical Practice”, in A. W. Hughes and R. E. Wolfson (eds.), New Directions in Jewish Philosophy, Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 205–228.
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Other Internet Resources

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